Supplement to Formal Epistemology

Two networks with identical priors encounter identical evidence, but only one discovers the truth

Description of video: Two networks are shown, each with six nodes arranged in a hexagon. The first network is complete: each node has a line connecting it to every other node. The second network is a cycle: only adjacent nodes are connected by a line. The nodes are coloured from dark to light; the legend indicates that the lighter the colour, the higher the doctor’s credence. At the beginning of the animation, the colours are the same in both networks: the darkest node is at the 9 o’clock position, and the nodes lighten clockwise around the hexagon. As the animation plays, the nodes get darker or lighter, while a counter labeled ‘Epoch’ starts from zero and counts up to 587. By epoch 28, the nodes in the first network have all gone dark, and they stop changing colour for the rest of the video. But the second network keeps changing throughout the video. Early on, most of its nodes have gone dark and aren’t changing, but the bottom left node and its neighbours continue to fluctuate and brighten. After a while their neighbours start to do the same, and eventually the whole of the second network brightens and the animation ends.

Copyright © 2021 by
Jonathan Weisberg <jonathan.weisberg@utoronto.ca>

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