Hume on Free Will

First published Fri Dec 14, 2007; substantive revision Wed May 27, 2020
But to proceed in this reconciling project with regard to the question of liberty and necessity; the most contentious question of metaphysics, the most contentious science… —David Hume (EU 8.23/95)

It is widely accepted that David Hume’s contribution to the free will debate is one of the most influential statements of the “compatibilist” position, where this is understood as the view that human freedom and moral responsibility can be reconciled with (causal) determinism. Hume’s arguments on this subject are found primarily in the sections titled “Of liberty and necessity”, as first presented in A Treatise of Human Nature (2.3.1–2) and, later, in a slightly amended form, in the Enquiry concerning Human Understanding (sec. 8). Although both contributions share the same title, there are, nevertheless, some significant differences between them. This includes, for example, some substantial additions in the Enquiry discussion as it relates to problems of religion, such as predestination and divine foreknowledge. These differences should not, however, be exaggerated. Hume’s basic strategy and compatibilist commitments remain much the same in both works.

This article will be arranged around a basic contrast between two alternative interpretations of Hume’s compatibilist strategy: the “classical” and “naturalistic” interpretations. According to the classical account, Hume’s effort to articulate the conditions of moral responsibility, and the way they relate to the free will problem, should be understood primarily in terms of his views about the logic of the concepts of “liberty” and “necessity”. In contrast with this, the naturalistic approach maintains that what is essential to Hume’s account of the nature and conditions of responsible conduct is his description of the role that moral sentiment plays in this sphere. How we interpret Hume’s core arguments relating to the free will debate must be understood, on this view, with reference to these psychological claims and concerns (which also accounts for the use of the label “naturalism” in this context). On either account, the contrast between these two interpretations will be of importance, not only for our general understanding of Hume’s philosophical system, but also for any adequate assessment of the contemporary value and relevance of Hume’s views on this subject.

The first two sections of this article present and contrast the classical and naturalistic interpretations. Hume’s views on causation and necessity are highly relevant to both these interpretations. The following three sections sections consider the contemporary significance of Hume’s contribution, particularly as interpreted by the naturalistic account. The sixth and final section examines the relevance of Hume’s views on free will for matters of religion.

1. “Liberty and Necessity” – The Classical Reading

For many years the established view of Hume has been that he is a principal and founding figure of classical compatibilism, as located in the empiricist philosophical tradition that stretches from Hobbes, through Hume, on to Mill, Russell, Schlick and Ayer. Classical compatibilists believe, with libertarians, that we need some adequate theory of what free action is, where this is understood as providing the relevant conditions of moral agency and responsibility. Compatibilists, however, reject the view that free action requires the falsity of determinism or that an action cannot be both free and causally necessitated by antecedent conditions. According to the classical compatibilist strategy, not only is freedom compatible with causal determinism, the absence of causation and necessity would make free and responsible action impossible. A free action is an action caused by the agent, whereas an unfree action is caused by some other, external cause. Whether an action is free or not depends on the type of cause, not on the absence of causation and necessity. An uncaused action would be entirely capricious and random and could not be attributed to any agent, much less interpreted as a free and responsible act. Understood this way, the classical compatibilist strategy involves an attempt to explain and describe the logic of our concepts relating to issues of freedom and determinism. It is primarily concerned with conceptual issues rather than with any empirical investigations into our human moral psychology. On the classical interpretation this is how Hume’s core arguments should be understood.

As Hume’s title “Of liberty and necessity” makes plain there are two key ideas in play are “liberty” (freedom) and “necessity” (causation and determinism). In his Abstract of the Treatise Hume emphasizes that his “reasoning puts the whole [free-will] controversy in a new light, by giving a new definition of necessity” (T Abs. 34/ 661). Despite this, the classical interpretation places heavy weight on the significance of his views on the nature of liberty as the relevant basis for explaining Hume’s position on this subject. The strategy that Hume follows, according to this reading, is much the same as that which was pursued by Hobbes. It is the distinction between two kinds of liberty that is, on this account, especially important. Hume’s views on liberty in the Treatise are not, however, entirely consistent with his later views as presented in the Enquiry.

In the Treatise Hume distinguishes between two kinds of liberty.

Few are capable of distinguishing betwixt the liberty of spontaneity, as it is call’d in the schools, and the liberty of indifference; betwixt that which is oppos’d to violence, and that which means a negation of necessity and causes. The first is even the most common sense of the word; and as ’tis only that species of liberty, which it concerns us to preserve, our thoughts have been principally turn’d towards it, and have almost universally confounded it with the other. (T 2.3.2.1/407–8)

Liberty of spontaneity involves an agent being able to act according to her own willings and desires, unhindered by external obstacles which might constrain or restrict her conduct (e.g., the walls or bars of a prison [T 2.3.1.17/406]). This kind of liberty does not imply an absence of causation and necessity, unless we incorrectly assume that what is caused is somehow compelled or forced to occur. In the Enquiry Hume drops the distinction between two kinds of liberty and instead provides an account of what he calls “hypothetical liberty” (EU 8.23/95). A liberty of this kind involves “a power of acting or not acting, according to the determinations of the will; that is, if we choose to remain at rest, we may; if we choose to move, we also may.” According to Hume this sort of hypothetical liberty is “universally allowed to belong to every one, who is not a prisoner and in chains” (ibid.). Although Hume is committed to the existence of both liberty of spontaneity and hypothetical liberty, they are not the same. A person may enjoy liberty of spontaneity and act according to the determinations of her own will, and still lack hypothetical liberty. If she chose otherwise her action might still be obstructed (e.g., as with a person who chooses to remain in a room but could not leave if she chose to because the door is locked).

In the Treatise Hume tends to identify liberty with indifference rather than spontaneity and even suggests “that liberty and chance are synonimous” (T 2.3.2.8/412; cf. T 2.3.1.18/407; but see also EU 8.25/96). For this reason he presents his arguments as aiming to show that liberty, so understood (qua indifference), is, if not contradictory, “directly contrary to experience” (T 2.3.1.18/407). In placing emphasis on this negative task of refuting “the doctrine of liberty or chance” (T 2.3.2.7/412), Hume is happy to present himself as coming down firmly on the side of “the doctrine of necessity” (T 2.3.2.3/409), which he is careful to define in a way that avoids any confusion between causation and compulsion or force (as is explained in more detail below). The account that Hume offers in the Enquiry strikes a more balanced note. In this work Hume presents his position as not so much a refutation of “the doctrine of liberty” or “free-will” (T 2.3.1.18/407; cf. T 2.1.10.5/312), but rather as a “reconciling project with regard to the question of liberty and necessity” (EU 8.23/95; although even in the Enquiry his references to liberty are not uniformly to spontaneity). Although these differences should be noted, it is important not to exaggerate them. In the Treatise Hume makes clear that liberty of spontaneity is “the most common sense of the word” and the “only… species of liberty, which it concerns us to preserve” (T 2.3.2.1/407–8). It is evident, therefore, that there is also a “reconciling project” implicit in the Treatise and that his arguments against “the doctrine of liberty” remain tightly focused on liberty of indifference.

In both the Treatise and the Enquiry Hume claims that the most original or interesting part of his contribution to free will rests with his definition or understanding of what we mean by necessity (T 2.3.1.18, 2.3.2.4/407, 409–10; see also EU 8.1–3, 8.21–25/80–81, 92–96). It is this issue, Hume claims, that has been the primary obstacle to resolving this controversy. According to Hume there are “two particulars, which we are to consider as essential to necessity, viz. the constant union and the inference of the mind; and wherever we discover these we must acknowledge a necessity” (T 2.3.1.4/400). In order to explain this, Hume begins with a description of causation and necessity as we observe it in “the operations of external bodies” (T 2.3.1.3/399) or in “the actions of matter” (T Abs. 34/ 661). Here we find “not the least traces of indifference or liberty” and we can see that “[e]very object is determin’d by an absolute fate” (T 2.3.1.3/400). What this means, Hume explains, is that we discover that there exist constant conjunctions of objects, whereby resembling objects of one kind are uniformly followed by resembling objects of another kind (e.g., Xs are uniformly followed by Ys). (See, in particular, T 1.3; T Abs. 8–9, 24–26/649–50, 655–57; and also EU 4 and 7). When we experience regularities of this sort we are able to draw relevant inferences, and we deem objects of the first kind causes and those of the second kind their effects.

The crucial point, on Hume’s account, is that we can discover no further “ultimate connexion” (T 1.3.6.11/91) between cause and effect beyond our experience of their regular union. There is no perceived or known power or energy in a cause such that we could draw any inference to its effect or by which the cause compels or forces its effect to occur (T 1.3.12.20, 1.3.14.4–7/139, 157–59). Nevertheless, on the basis of our experience of regularities or constant conjunctions of objects, the mind, on the appearance of the first object, naturally draws an inference to that of the other (T 1.3.14.20–22, 31/164–66, 169–70; cf. EU 7.28–29/75–77). In other words, our experience of regularities serves as the basis upon which we can draw inferences to the existence of an object on the appearance of another. All that we find of causation and necessity in bodies or matter, Hume argues, is this conjunction of like objects along with the inference of the mind from one to the other. The relevant question, therefore, is do we find similar features in the operations of human action?

Our experience, Hume maintains, proves that “our actions have a constant union with our motives, tempers, and circumstances” and that we draw relevant inferences from one to the other on this basis (T 2.3.1.4/401). Although there are some apparent irregularities in both the natural and the moral realms, this is entirely due to the influence of contrary or concealed causes of which we are ignorant (T 2.3.1.11–12/403–4; cf. EU 8.15/88).

[T]he union betwixt motives and actions has the same constancy, as that in any natural operations, so its influence on the understanding is also the same, in determining us to infer the existence of one from that of another. If this shall appear, there is no known circumstance, that enters into the connexion and production of the actions of matter, that is not to be found in all the operations of the mind; and consequently we cannot, without a manifest absurdity, attribute necessity to the one, and refuse it to the other. (T 2.3.1.14/404)

In support of this claim Hume cites various regularities that we observe in human society, where class, sex, occupation, age, and other such factors are seen to be reliably correlated with different motives and conduct (T 2.3.1.5–10/401–3). Regularities of this kind make it possible for us to draw the sorts of inferences that are needed for human social life, such as in all our reasoning concerning business, politics, war, and so on (T 2.3.1.15/405; EU 8.17–18/89–90). In the absence of necessity, so understood, we could not survive or live together.

Hume goes on to argue that not only is necessity of this kind essential to human society, it is also “essential to religion and morality” (T 2.3.2.5 410), because of its relevance to the foundations of responsibility and punishment. If the motives of rewards and punishments had no uniform and reliable influence on conduct then law and society would be impossible (ibid.; cp. EU 8.28/ 97–98; see also T 3.3.4.4/609). Beyond this, whether we consider human or divine rewards and punishments, the justice of such practices depends on the fact that the agent has produced or brought about these actions through her own will. The “doctrine of liberty or chance,” however, would remove this connection between agent and action and so no one could be properly held accountable for their conduct (T 2.3.2.6/411). It is, therefore, “only upon the principles of necessity, that a person acquires any merit or demerit from his actions, however the common opinion may incline to the contrary” (ibid.; EU 8.31/99). Read this way, Hume is mostly restating a claim found in many other compatibilist accounts, that necessity (determinism) is needed to support a generally forward-looking, utilitarian theory of moral responsibility and punishment.

Why, then is there so much resistance to “the doctrine of necessity”? The principal explanation for this resistance to “the doctrine of necessity” is found, according to Hume, in confusion about the nature of necessity as we discover it in matter. Although in ordinary life we all rely upon and reason upon the principles of necessity there may well be some reluctance to call this union and inference necessity.

But as long as the meaning is understood, I hope the word can do no harm.… I may be mistaken in asserting, that we have no idea of any other connexion in the actions of body.… But sure I am, I ascribe nothing to the actions of the mind, but what must readily be allow’d of.… I do not ascribe to the will that unintelligible necessity, which is suppos’d to lie in matter. But I ascribe to matter, that intelligible quality, call it necessity or not, which the most rigorous orthodoxy does or must allow to belong to the will. I change, therefore, nothing in the receiv’d systems, with regard to the will, but only with regard to material objects. (T 2.3.2.4/410; cp. EU 8.22/93–94)

The supposition that there is some further power or energy in matter, whereby causes somehow compel or force their effects to occur, is the fundamental source of confusion on this issue. It is this that encourages us to reject the suggestion that our actions are subject to necessity on the ground that this would imply some kind of violence or constraint – something that would be incompatible with liberty of spontaneity. When confusions of this sort are removed, all that remains is the verbal quibble about using the term “necessity” – which is not itself a substantial point of disagreement.

Hume’s suggestion that our ideas of causation and necessity should be understood in terms of constant conjunction of objects and the inference of the mind became a central thread of the classical compatibilist position. A key element of this is his diagnosis of the source of incompatibilism as rooted in a confusion between causation and compulsion. What are we to make of this aspect of the compatibilist strategy? The first thing we need to consider is how this argument stands in relation to the other compatibilist arguments already described? We may begin by noting that Hume’s strategy, as built around his “new definition of necessity” (TA, 34/661), appears to concede that a stronger metaphysical “tie” or “bond” between cause and effect would indeed “imply something of force, violence, and constraint”. From the perspective of the (core) compatibilist argument, as developed around the notion of “liberty of spontaneity” and “hypothetical liberty”, this is a basic mistake. The distinction that is crucial to the original argument is that between actions that have causes that are internal to the agent (i.e., motives and desires of some relevant kind) and those that have external causes. It is the latter that are compelled or constrained actions (such as we find in the case of the prisoner who is in chains: EU 8.23/95). This crucial distinction between actions that are brought about through the agent’s motives and desires and those that are not is not compromised by “metaphysical” (non-regularity) accounts of causation. What is relevant to whether an action was compelled or not is the nature of the cause (i.e., the object), not the nature of the causal relation. Hume’s argument relating to the advantages of his “new definition of necessity” directly challenges this – so one or other of these two claims must be abandoned.

Another crucial claim of the original strategy was that if an agent is to be (justly) held responsible for her actions then she must be causally connected to them in the right way. Hume’s “new definition of necessity” presents some awkward problems for this requirement. More specifically, it may be argued that if we remove “metaphysical” necessity of any kind from our conception of the causal relation, and all objects are “entirely loose and separate... conjoined but never connected” (EU 7.26/73–4 – Hume’s emphasis), Hume’s own form of compatibilism is vulnerable to the same objection that he raised against the suggestion that free actions are uncaused. That is to say, a mere regular conjunction between events cannot serve to adequately connect the agent with her action. Hume’s theory of causation, therefore, threatens to saw off the compatibilist branch that he is sitting on.

Apart from these “internal” difficulties among Hume’s core arguments, it may also be questioned whether Hume’s alternative account of causation serves to allay or diffuse other (and deeper) worries that libertarians and incompatibilists may have about his proposed “reconciliation”. What libertarians seek – particularly but not exclusively in the 18th c. context – is an account of moral agency that rests with agents who possess active powers of some kind such that they have genuine open alternatives in the same (causal) conditions. Related to this, libertarians also insist on making a distinction between agents who can intervene in the natural causal order and, on the other side, beings who are simply part of the natural causal order and fully integrated within it. Real agency requires the causal series to begin with the agent, not to run through the agent. Hume’s revisionary “new definitions” of causation and necessity satisfies none of these fundamental concerns or requirements. Although Hume suggests that “a few intelligible definitions” should immediately put an end to this controversy (EU 8.2/81), he must have been well aware that he was far from providing the sort of metaphysical resources that libertarians are seeking or satisfying the demands that they place on free, responsible moral agency.

Hume also advances two other explanations for resistance to “the doctrine of necessity”. One of these concerns religion, which we discuss further below. The other concerns, what we might describe as the phenomenology of agency and the way in which it seems to discredit Hume’s necessitarian claims. Hume concedes that when we consider our actions from the agent’s perspective (i.e., the first person perspective) we have “a false sensation or experience even of the liberty of indifference” (T 2.3.2.2/408 – Hume’s emphasis; cf. EU 8.22n18/94n). The basis of this is that when we are acting we may not experience any “determination of thought” whereby we infer the action to be performed. However, from the spectator’s (third person) perspective the situation is quite different. The spectator will “seldom feel such a looseness and indifference” and will reliably infer actions from an agent’s motives and character. For this reason, although when we act we may find it hard to accept that “we were govern’d by necessity, and that ’twas utterly impossible for us to have acted otherwise” (T 2.3.2.1/407), the spectator’s perspective shows that this is simply a “false sensation”. Put another way, the agent perspective may encourage the view that the future is “open” with respect to how we will act but this supposition is contradicted by the opposing spectator perspective, which is generally reliable. It is worth adding that this claim is consistent with Hume’s account in the Enquiry of “hypothetical liberty”. There is no contradiction between a spectator being able to reliably infer how an agent will act and the fact that how that agent will act depends on how he wills in these circumstances.

The above interpretation suggests that Hume’s primary aim in his discussion “Of liberty and necessity” is to defend an account of moral freedom understood in terms of “liberty of spontaneity”. Our tendency to confuse this form of liberty with indifference is a result of a mistaken understanding of the nature of causation and necessity. The significance of Hume’s contribution, on this interpretation, rests largely with his application of his “new definition of necessity” to this issue. All this is, in turn, generally consistent with arguments by leading representatives of classical compatibilism who came after Hume (viz. Mill, Russell, Schlick, Ayer, et al). If this is an accurate and complete account of Hume’s approach then it is liable to all the objections that have been levelled against the classical compatibilist view.

The first and most obvious of these objections is that “liberty of spontaneity” is a wholly inadequate conception of moral freedom. Kant, famously, describes this account of moral freedom as a “wretched subterfuge” and suggests that a freedom of this kind belongs to a clock that moves its hands by means of internal causes. If our will is itself determined by antecedent natural causes, then we are no more accountable for our actions than any other mechanical object whose movements are internally conditioned. Individuals who enjoy nothing more than a liberty of this nature are, the incompatibilist claims, little more than “robots” or “puppets” subject to the play of fate. This general line of criticism, targeted against any understanding of moral freedom in terms of “spontaneity”, leads directly to two further important criticisms.

The incompatibilist maintains that if our willings and choices are themselves determined by antecedent causes then we could never choose otherwise than we do. Given the antecedent causal conditions, we must always act as we do. We cannot, therefore, be held responsible for our conduct since, on this account, we have no “genuine alternatives” or “open possibilities” available to us. Incompatibilists, as already noted, do not accept that Hume’s notion of “hypothetical liberty”, as presented in the Enquiry, can deal with this objection. It is true, of course, that hypothetical liberty leaves room for the truth of conditionals that suggest that we could have acted otherwise if we had chosen to do so. However, it still remains the case, the incompatibilist argues, that the agent could not have chosen otherwise given the actual circumstances. Responsibility, they claim, requires categorical freedom to choose otherwise in the same circumstances. Hypothetical freedom alone will not suffice. One way of expressing this point in more general terms is that the incompatibilist holds that for responsibility we need more than freedom of action, we also need freedom of will – understood as a power to choose between open alternatives. Failing this, the agent has no ultimate control over her conduct.

Hume’s effort to draw a distinction between free and unfree (i.e., compelled) action itself rests on a distinction between internal and external causes. Critics of compatibilism argue that this – attractively simple – distinction is impossible to maintain. It seems obvious, for example, that there are cases in which an agent acts according to the determinations of his own will but is nevertheless clearly unfree. There are, in particular, circumstances in which an agent may be subject to, and act on, desires and wants that are themselves compulsive in nature (e.g., as with a drug addict or kleptomaniac). Desires and wants of this kind, it is claimed, limit and undermine an agent’s freedom no less than external force and violence. Although it may be true that in these circumstances the agent is acting according to his own desires or willings, it is equally clear that such an agent is neither free nor responsible for his behavior. It would appear, therefore, that we are required to acknowledge that some causes “internal” to the agent may also be regarded as compelling or constraining. This concession, however, generates serious difficulties for the classical compatibilist strategy. It is no longer evident, given this concession, which “internal” causes should be regarded as “constraining” or “compelling” and which should not. Lying behind this objection is the more fundamental concern that the spontaneity argument presupposes a wholly inadequate understanding of the nature of excusing and mitigating considerations.

Finally, on this reading, Hume is understood as defending an essentially forward-looking and utilitarian account of moral responsibility. Following thinkers like Thomas Hobbes, Hume points out that rewards and punishments serve to cause people to act in some ways and not in others, which is clearly a matter of considerable social utility (T 2.3.2.5/410; EU 8.2897–98). This sort of forward-looking, utilitarian account of responsibility has been further developed by a number of other compatibilists with whom Hume is often closely identified (e.g., Moritz Schlick and J.J.C. Smart). Forward-looking, utilitarian accounts of responsibility of this kind have been subject to telling criticism. The basic problem with any account of this kind, incompatibilists have argued, is that they are entirely blind to matters of desert and so lack the required (backward-looking) retributive element that is required in this sphere. Moreover, any theory of responsibility of this kind, critics say, is both too wide and too narrow. It is too wide because it would appear to make children and animals responsible; and it is too narrow because it implies that those who are dead and beyond the reach of the relevant forms of “treatment” are actually responsible for their actions. For all these reasons, critics argue, we should reject compatibilist theories constructed along the lines of these distinctions.

2. Free Will and Moral Sentiment – The Naturalistic Reading

What we need to ask now is to what extent the classical interpretation serves to capture the essentials of Hume’s position on this subject? From the perspective of the alternative naturalistic reading there are two fundamental flaws in the classical reading:

  • First, and foremost, the classical reading fails to provide any proper account of the role of moral sentiment in Hume’s understanding of (the nature and conditions) of moral responsibility. Part of the explanation for this is that the classical interpretation treats Hume’s views on free will in isolation from other parts of his philosophical system. In particular, it fails to adequately integrate his discussion of free will with his theory of the passions (T 2.1 and 2.2). We are more vulnerable to this mistake if we rely too heavily on Hume’s discussion “Of liberty and necessity” as presented in the Enquiry.

  • Second, and related to the first issue, the classical reading suggests an overly simple, if not crude, account of the relationship between freedom and moral responsibility. Whereas the classical account suggests that responsibility may be analyzed directly in terms of free (or voluntary) action, the naturalistic interpretation suggests a very different picture of this relationship. It would not be correct, for example, to interpret Hume as endorsing what J.L. Mackie has called “the straight rule of responsibility”: which is that “an agent is responsible for all and only his intentional actions” (Mackie, 1977): 208; and also 221–2). This is, nevertheless, a view that the classical interpretation encourages.

In order to see where the classical interpretation goes wrong we need to begin with an examination of Hume’s arguments in support of the claim that necessity is essential to morality and that “indifference” would make morality impossible (T 2.3.2.5–7/410–2).

Hume’s claim that necessity is essential to morality runs parallel to his claim that necessity is also essential to social life (T 2.3.1.8–15/401–05). To live in society people must be able to infer the actions of others from their motives and characters. Similarly, unless we were able to infer character from action no one could be held responsible and morality would be impossible. To understand the basis of this claim we need to get a clearer picture of what it is to be held responsible on Hume’s account – a picture that is very different from the forward-looking, utilitarian-oriented view suggested by the classical interpretation. Holding a person responsible is, for Hume, a matter of regarding a person as an object of the moral sentiments of approval and disapproval. Approval and disapproval are “nothing but a fainter and more imperceptible love and hatred” (T 3.3.5.1/614). They are, more specifically, calm forms of love and hatred, which are themselves indirect passions.

In order to understand the relevance of necessity for the conditions of holding a person responsible we we need to understand the workings of “the regular mechanism” of the indirect passions (DP 6.19). In his discussion of love and hatred Hume says:

One of these suppositions, viz. that the cause of love and hatred must be related to a person or thinking being, in order to produce these passions, is not only probable, but too evident to be contested. Virtue and vice, when consider’d in the abstract… excite no degree of love and hatred, esteem or contempt towards those, who have no relation to them. (T 2.2.1.7/331)

Our virtues and vices are not the only causes of love and hatred. Wealth and property, family and social relations, bodily qualities and attributes may also generate love or hate (T 2.1.2.5; 2.1.7.1–5/279, 294f; DP 2.14–33). It is, nevertheless, our virtues and vices, understood as pleasurable or painful qualities of mind, that are “the most obvious causes of these passions” (T 2.1.7.2/295; cp. 3.1.2.5/473; and also 3.3.1.3/574–5). In this way, by means of the general mechanism of the indirect passions, virtue and vice give rise to that “faint and imperceptible” form of love and hatred which constitutes the moral sentiments. This is essential to all our ascriptions of moral responsibility.

Hume makes clear that it is not actions, as such, that give rise to our moral sentiments but rather our more enduring or persisting character traits (T 2.2.3.4/348–9; and also 3.3.1.4–5/575). The crucial passage in his discussion “Of liberty and necessity” is the following:

Actions are by their very nature temporary and perishing; and where they proceed not from some cause in the characters and disposition of the person, who perform’d them, they infix not themselves upon him, and can neither redound to his honour, if good, nor infamy, if evil. The action itself may be blameable… But the person is not responsible for it; and as it proceeded from nothing in him, that is durable or constant, and leaves nothing of that nature behind it, ‘tis impossible he can, upon its account, become the object of punishment or vengeance. (T 2.3.2.6/411; cp. EU 8.29/98; see also T 3.3.3.4/575: “If any action…”)

Further below, in Book II, Hume expands on these remarks:

‘Tis evident, that when we praise any actions, we regard only the motives that produc’d them, and consider the actions as signs or indications of certain principles in the mind and temper. The external performance has no merit. We must look within to find the moral quality. This we cannot do directly; and therefore fix our attention on actions, as on external signs. But these actions are still consider’d as signs; and the ultimate object of our praise and approbation is the motive, that produc’d them. (T 3.2.1.2/477; cp. 3.2.1.8/479; EU 8.31/99)

In these two passages Hume is making two distinct but related points. First, he maintains that “action”, considered as an “external performance” without any reference to the motive or intention that produced it, is not itself of moral concern. It is, rather, the “internal” cause of the action that arouses our moral sentiments. It is these aspects of action that inform us about the mind and moral character of the agent. Second, the moral qualities of an agent that arouse our moral sentiments must be “durable or constant” – they cannot be “temporary and perishing” in nature in the way actions are. This second condition on the generation of moral sentiment is itself a particular instance of the more general observation that Hume has made earlier on in Book II that the relationship between the quality or feature that gives rise to the indirect passions (i.e., its cause) and the person who is the object of the passion must not be “casual or inconstant” (T 2.1.6.7/293). It is, nevertheless, the first point that is especially important for our present purpose of understanding why necessity is essential to morality.

In order to know anyone’s motives and character we require inference, from their actions to their motives and character (T 2.1.11.3; 3.3.1.7/317, 576). Without knowledge of anyone’s character no sentiment of approbation or blame would be aroused in us. Without inferences moving in this direction – from action to character (as opposed to from character to actions) – no one would be an object of praise or blame and, hence, no one would be regarded as morally responsible. In these circumstances, praising and blaming would be psychologically impossible. Along the same lines, external violence, like liberty of indifference, also makes it impossible to regard someone as an object of praise or blame. When an action is produced by causes external to the agent we are led away from the agent’s character. Clearly, then, actions that are either uncaused or caused by external factors cannot render an agent responsible, not because it would be unreasonable to hold the person responsible, but rather because it would be psychologically impossible to hold the person responsible, where this stance is understood in terms of the operation of the moral sentiments. It is in this way that Hume brings his observations concerning the operation of the indirect passions to bear on his claim that necessity is essential to morality and, in particular, to our attitudes and practices associated with responsibility and punishment.

In light of this alternative account, we may conclude that the nature of Hume’s compatibilist strategy is significantly misrepresented by the classical interpretation. Hume’s arguments purporting to show that necessity is essential to morality are intimately connected with his discussion of the indirect passions and the specific mechanism that generates the moral sentiments. Whereas the classical interpretation construes his arguments as conceptual or logical in nature, the naturalistic interpretation presents Hume as concerned to describe the circumstances under which people are felt to be responsible. Interpreted this way, Hume’s arguments constitute a contribution to descriptive moral psychology and, as such, they are an important part of his wider program to “introduce the experimental method of reasoning into moral subjects” (which is the subtitle of the Treatise).

3. Hume’s Naturalism and Strawson’s “Reconciling Project”

The next question to consider is whether or not the issues that divide the classical and naturalistic interpretations are of any contemporary significance or interest? The first thing to be said about this is that from a contemporary perspective, classical compatibilism seems too crude an account of both freedom and moral responsibility and very few philosophers would still press the claim that incompatibilist prejudices can be explained simply in terms of confusion about necessity arising from a conflation between causation and compulsion. In contrast with this, Hume’s concern with the role and relevance of moral sentiment for our understanding of the free will problem anticipates several key features of P.F. Strawson’s highly influential contribution to the contemporary debate. Strawson’s “Freedom and Resentment” [hereafter FR] is arguably the most important and influential paper concerning the free will problem published in the second half of the twentieth century. The most striking affinity between the approaches taken by Hume and Strawson is their shared appeal to the role of moral sentiments or reactive attitudes, which both use as a way of discrediting any supposed sceptical threat arising from the thesis of determinism.

On Strawson’s account, both classical compatibilists (whom he refers to as “optimists”) and libertarians (whom he refers to as “pessimists”, because they suppose determinism threatens moral responsibility) make a similar mistake of “over-intellectualizing the facts” by seeking to provide some sort of “external ‘rational’ justification” for moral responsibility (FR, 81). The classical compatibilist does this on the basis of a “one-eyed utilitarianism”, whereas the libertarian, seeing that something vital is missing from the classical compatibilist account, tries to plug the gap with “contra-causal freedom” – which Strawson describes as “a pitiful intellectualist trinket” (FR, 81). Against views of these kinds, Strawson argues that we should focus our attention on the importance of reactive attitudes or moral sentiments in this context. By this means he hopes to find some middle ground whereby he can “reconcile” the two opposing camps. Our reactive attitudes or moral sentiments, Strawson argues, should be understood in terms of our natural human emotional responses to the attitudes and intentions that human beings manifest towards each other. We expect and demand some degree of good will and due regard and we feel resentment or gratitude depending on whether or not this is shown to us (FR, 66–7). Granted that these emotions are part of our essential human make-up, and are naturally triggered or aroused in relevant circumstances, it is still important to recognize that these responses are in some measure under rational control and we can “modify or mollify” them in light of relevant considerations (FR, 68).

There are two kinds of consideration that Strawson distinguishes that may require us to amend or withdraw our reactive attitudes. First, there are considerations that we may describe as exemptions, where we judge that an individual is not an appropriate or suitable target of any reactive attitudes. These are cases where a person may be viewed as “psychologically abnormal” or “morally underdeveloped” (FR, 68; and also 71–2). On the other hand, even where exemptions of this sort do not apply, ordinary excusing considerations may nevertheless require us to alter or change our particular reactive attitudes as directed toward some individual (FR, 68). Considerations of this kind include cases where an agent acts accidentally, or in ignorance, or was subject to physical force of some kind. Where these considerations apply we may come to recognize that the conduct in question, properly interpreted, does not lack the degree of good will or due regard that we may demand. Even if some injury has occurred, no malice or lack of regard has been shown to us. However, the crucial point for Strawson is that while our reactive attitudes may well be modified or withdrawn in these circumstances, there is no question of us altogether abandoning or suspending our reactive attitudes (FR, 71–3). In particular, there is nothing about the thesis of determinism that implies that either exemptions or excuses, as Strawson has described them, apply or hold universally (FR, 70–1). Moreover, and more controversially, Strawson also maintains that even if determinism did provide some “theoretical” basis for drawing this sceptical conclusion, any such policy is “for us as we are, practically inconceivable” (FR, 71). In other words, according to Strawson our natural commitment to the fabric of moral sentiment insulates us from any possible global sceptical threat to the whole fabric of moral responsibility based on theoretical worries about the implications of determinism.

If we read Hume along the lines of the classical interpretation, then his position on these issues looks as if it accords very closely with the typical “optimist” strategy associated with such thinkers as Schlick. The classical interpretation, however, entirely overlooks the role of moral sentiment in Hume’s reconciling strategy. It emphasizes the relevance of the (supposed) confusion between causation and compulsion in order to explain the more fundamental confusion about the nature of liberty (i.e., why philosophers tend to confuse liberty of spontaneity with liberty of indifference). With these features of Hume’s position established, the classical interpretation points to Hume’s remarks concerning the social utility of rewards and punishments and the way in which they depend on the principles of necessity. From this perspective, Hume’s discussion of freedom and necessity clearly constitutes a paradigmatic and influential statement of the “optimist’s” position. So interpreted, Hume must be read as a thinker, like Schlick, who has “over-intellectualized the facts” on the basis of a “one-eyed-utilitarianism”; one who has ignored “that complicated web of attitudes and feelings” which Strawson seeks to draw our attention to. In this way, we are encouraged to view Hume as a prime target of Strawson’s attack on the “optimist” position.

The naturalistic interpretation, by contrast, makes it plain that any such view of Hume’s approach and general strategy is deeply mistaken. Hume, no less than Strawson, is especially concerned to draw our attention to the facts about human nature that are relevant to a proper understanding of the nature and conditions of moral responsibility. More specifically, Hume argues that we cannot properly account for moral responsibility unless we acknowledge and describe the role that moral sentiment plays in this sphere. Indeed, unlike Strawson, Hume is much more concerned with the detailed mechanism whereby our moral sentiments are aroused, and thus he is particularly concerned to explain the relevance of spontaneity, indifference, and necessity to the functioning of moral sentiment. To this extent, therefore, Hume’s naturalistic approach is more tightly woven into his account of the nature of necessity and moral freedom. In sum, when we compare Hume’s arguments with Strawson’s important and influential discussion, it becomes immediately apparent that there is considerable contemporary significance to the contrast between the classical and naturalistic interpretations of Hume’s reconciling strategy.

The overall resemblance between Hume’s and Strawson’s strategy in dealing with issues of freedom and responsibility is striking. The fundamental point that they agree about is that we cannot understand the nature and conditions of moral responsibility without reference to the crucial role that moral sentiment plays in this sphere. This naturalistic approach places Hume and Strawson in similar positions when considered in relation to the views of the pessimist and the optimist. The naturalistic approach shows that, in different ways, both sides of the traditional debate fail to properly acknowledge the facts about moral sentiment. Where Hume most noticeably differs from Strawson, however, is on the question of the “general causes” of moral sentiment. Strawson largely bypasses this problem. For Hume, this is a crucial issue that must be settled to understand why necessity is essential to responsibility and why indifference is entirely incompatible with the effective operation of the mechanism that responsibility depends on.

4. Virtue, Luck and “the Morality System”

We have noted that the classical and naturalistic interpretations differ in how they account for the relationship between freedom and responsibility. According to the classical interpretation responsibility may be analysed directly in terms of free action, where this is understood simply in terms of an agent acting according to her own will or desires. While classical compatibilists reject the incompatibilist suggestion that free and responsible action requires indeterminism or any special form of “moral causation” they are, nevertheless, both agreed that a person can be held responsible if and only if she acts freely. On the naturalistic interpretation, however, Hume rejects this general doctrine, which we may call “voluntarism”.

Hume maintains that it is a matter of “the utmost importance” for moral philosophy that action must be indicative of durable qualities of mind if a person is to be held accountable for it (T 3.3.1.4/575). This claim is part of Hume’s more general claim that our indirect passions (including our moral sentiments) are aroused and sustained only when the pleasurable or painful qualities concerned (e.g. the virtues and vices) stand in a durable or constant relation with the person who is their object (T 2.1.6.7/292–3; DP 2.11). In the case of actions, which are “temporary and perishing”, no such lasting relation is involved unless action is suitably tied to character traits of some kind. Two important issues arise out of this that need to be carefully distinguished.

(1) Does Hume hold that all aspects of virtue for which a person is subject to moral evaluation (i.e., approval and disapproval) must be voluntarily expressed? That is to say, are virtues and vices to be assessed entirely on the basis of an agent’s deliberate choices and intentional actions?

(2) Granted that virtues and vices are to be understood in terms of a person’s pleasant or painful qualities of mind, to what extent are these traits of character voluntarily acquired (i.e., acquired through the agent’s own will and choices)?

Hume’s answer to both questions is clear. He denies that voluntary or intentional action is the sole basis on which we may assess a person’s virtues and vices. Furthermore he also maintains that moral character is, for the most part, involuntarily acquired. The second claim does not, of course, commit him to the first. Nor does the first commit him to the second, since a person could voluntarily acquire traits that, once acquired, may be involuntarily expressed or manifest. Plainly the combination of claims that Hume embraces on this issue commits him to a position that radically deflates the significance and importance of voluntariness in relation to virtue – certainly in comparison with some familiar alternative accounts (e.g. as in Aristotle).

Let us consider, first, the relevance of voluntariness to the expression of character. As we have already noted, Hume does take the view that actions serve as the principal way in which we learn about a person’s character (T 3.3.1.5/575). Action is produced by the causal influence of our desires and willings. The interpretation and evaluation of action must, therefore, take note of the particular intention with which an action was undertaken. Failing this, we are liable to attribute character traits to the agent that he does not possess (and consequently unjustly praise or blame him). Although intention and action do have a significant and important role to play in the assessment of moral character, Hume also maintains that there are other channels through which character may be expressed. More specifically, a virtuous or vicious character can be distinguished by reference to a person’s “wishes and sentiments,” as well as by the nature of the person’s will (T 3.3.1.5/575). Feelings, desires and sentiments manifest themselves in a wide variety of ways – not just through willing and acting. A person’s “countenance and conversation” (T 2.1.11.3/317), deportment or “carriage” (EU 8.15/88), gestures (EU 8.9/85), or simply her look and expression, may all serve as signs of character and qualities of mind that may be found to be pleasant or painful. Although we may enjoy some limited degree of control over our desires and passions, as well as how they are expressed, for the most part our emotional states and attitudes arise in us involuntarily and may even be manifest or expressed against our will.

We may now turn to the further question concerning Hume’s understanding of the way in which virtues and vices are acquired and, in particular, to what extent they are shaped and conditioned by our own choices. It is Hume’s view that, by and large, our character is conditioned and determined by factors independent of our will. In the sections “Of liberty and necessity” (T 2.3.1–2; EU 8) he argues that not only do we observe how certain characters will act in specific circumstances, we also observe how circumstances condition character. Among the factors that determine character, he claims, are bodily condition, age, sex, occupation and social station, climate, religion, government, and education (T 2.3.1.5–10/401–03; EU 8.7–15/83–8; see esp. EU 8.11/85–6: “Are the manners ...”). These various causal influences account for “the diversity of characters, prejudices, and opinions” (EU 8.10/85). Any accurate moral philosophy, it is argued, must acknowledge and take note of the forces that “mould the human mind from its infancy” and which account for “the gradual change in our sentiments and inclinations” through time (EU 8.11/86). The general force of these observations is to establish that “the fabric and constitution of our mind no more depends on our choice, than that of our body” (ESY 168; see also T 3.3.4.3/608; ESY 140, 160, 579).

Critics of Hume’s position on this subject will argue that if a person has little or no control over the factors that shape her character then virtue and vice really would be, in these circumstances, matters of mere good or bad fortune and no more a basis for moral concern than bodily beauty or ugliness. (See Reid 1969: 261: “What was, by an ancient author, said of Cato…”.) If people are responsible for the character that their actions and feelings express, then they must have acquired that character voluntarily. Hume’s reply to this line of criticism is that we can perfectly well distinguish virtue and vice without making any reference to the way that character is acquired. Our moral sentiments are reactions or responses to the moral qualities and character traits that people manifest in their behavior and conduct, and thus need not be withdrawn simply because people do not choose or voluntarily acquire these moral characteristics. Hume does recognize, of course, that we do have some limited ability to amend and alter our character. In particular, Hume acknowledges that we can cultivate and improve our moral character, in some measure, through self-criticism and self-understanding. Nevertheless, the points he emphasizes are that all such efforts are limited in their scope and effect (ESY 169) and that, beyond this, “a man must be, before-hand, tolerably virtuous” for such efforts of “reformation” to be undertaken in the first place.

Hume’s views about the relationship between virtue and voluntariness do much to explain one of the most controversial aspects of his theory of virtue: his view that the natural abilities should be incorporated into the virtues and vices (T 3.3.4; EM App 4). With respect to this issue he makes two key points. The first is that natural abilities (i.e., intelligence, imagination, memory, wit, etc.) and moral virtues more narrowly understood are “equally mental qualities” (T 3.3.4.1/606). Second, both of them “equally produce pleasure” and thus have “an equal tendency to produce the love and esteem of mankind” (T 3.3.4.1/606–07). In common life, people “naturally praise or blame whatever pleases or displeases them and thus regard penetration as much a virtue as justice” (T 3.3.4.4/609). (See, e.g., Hume’s sardonic observation at EM App. 4.5/315: “It is hard to tell...”) Beyond all this, as already noted, any distinction between the natural abilities and moral virtues cannot be based on the consideration that the natural abilities are for the most part involuntarily acquired, since this also holds true for the moral virtues more narrowly conceived. It is, nevertheless, Hume’s view that the voluntary/involuntary distinction helps to explain “why moralists have invented” the distinction between natural abilities and moral virtues. Unlike moral qualities, natural abilities “are almost invariable by any art or industry” (T 3.3.4.4/609). In contrast with this, moral qualities, “or at least, the actions that proceed from them, may be chang’d by the motives of rewards and punishments, praise and blame” (T 3.3.4.4/609). In this way, according to Hume, the significance of the voluntary/involuntary distinction is largely limited to our concern with the regulation of conduct in society. To confine our understanding of virtue and vice to these frontiers is, however, to distort and misrepresent its very nature and foundation in human life and experience. (For more on Hume’s views on virtue in relation to his position on free will see Russell, 2013.)

These observations regarding Hume and the doctrine of voluntarism are of considerable relevance to the contemporary ethical debate as it concerns what Bernard Williams has described as “the morality system” (Williams, 1985: Chp. 10). Although Williams’ (hostile) account of the morality system is multifaceted and defies easy summary, its core features are clear enough. The concept that Williams identifies as fundamental to the morality system is its special notion of obligation. Flowing from this special concept of obligation are the related concepts of right and wrong, blame and voluntariness. When agents voluntarily violate their obligations they do wrong and are liable to blame and some measure of retribution. To this extent the morality system, so conceived, involves what Williams calls “the blame system”, which focuses on particular acts (Williams, 1985: 194). According to Williams there is pressure within the blame system “to require a voluntariness that will be total and will cut through character and psychological or social determinism, and allocate blame and responsibility on the ultimately fair basis of the agent’s own contribution, no more and no less” (Williams, 1985: 194).

One reason why the morality system places great weight on the importance of voluntariness is that it aspires to show that morality – and moral responsibility in particular – somehow “transcends luck” (Williams, 1985: 195). This is required to ensure that blame is allocated in a way that is “ultimately fair”. Despite the obvious challenges this requirement poses, compatibilists have typically tried to satisfy these aspiration of the morality system by way of offering a variety of argument to show that compatibilist commitments do not render us vulnerable to the play of fate or luck in our moral lives (e.g. Dennett, 1984). Hume, however, makes little effort to satisfy these aspirations. (A point that Williams notes in Williams, 1995: 20n12.) In the final analysis, Hume claims, just as every body or material object “is determin’d by an absolute fate to a certain degree and direction of its motion, and can no more depart from that precise line, in which it moves, than it can convert itself into an angel, or spirit, or any superior substance” (T 2.3.1.3/400), so too our conduct and character is similarly subject to an “absolute fate” as understood in terms of the inescapable “bonds of necessity” (T 2.3.2.2/408). In these fundamental respects, therefore, Hume takes the view, along with Williams, that morality does not elude either fate or luck. In this Hume, perhaps, shares more with the ancient Greeks than he does with those moderns who embrace the aspirations of the morality system (see, e.g., Williams, 1993).

5. Moral Sense and Moral Capacity

From a critical perspective, it may be argued that there remains a significant gap in Hume’s scheme as we have so far described it. Even if we discard the aspirations of the morality system, any credible naturalistic theory of moral responsibility needs to be able to provide some account of the sorts of moral capacity involved in exempting conditions, whereby we deem some individuals and not others as appropriate targets of moral sentiments or “reactive attitudes”. As it stands, what Hume has to say on this subject is plainly inadequate. According to Hume, it is an ultimate inexplicable fact about our moral sentiments (qua calm forms of the indirect passions of love and hate) that they are always directed at people, either ourselves or others. This account leaves us unable say why some people are not appropriate objects of moral sentiments (e.g. children, the insane, and so on). There are, however, several available proposals for dealing with this gap. Perhaps the most influential proposal is to adopt some general theory of reason-responsiveness or rational self-control. According to accounts of this kind, responsible agents need to have control over their actions, where this involves performing “those actions intentionally, while possessing the relevant sorts of normative competence: the general ability to grasp moral requirements and to govern one’s conduct by light of them” (Wallace, 1994: 86). While proposals of this general kind help to plug a large gap in Hume’s theory, they also suggest a particular understanding of moral responsibility that is not entirely in keeping with Hume’s own account.

There are two points of divergence that are especially significant with respect to to issue. First, rational self-control may be explained, as it is on Wallace’s account, in terms of specifically Kantian conceptions of practical reason and moral agency (Wallace, 1994: 12–17). Even if commitments of this kind are avoided, theories of this kind are still too narrowly based on moral capacity as it relates solely to actions and intentions. On Hume’s account, moral capacity must be related to wider patterns and dispositions of feeling, desire and character. The scope of moral evaluation should not be reduced or limited to concern with (fleeting and momentary) acts of will modelled after legal paradigms. Moral capacity must be exercised and manifest in a larger and more diverse set of propensities and abilities that make up moral character, including the operation of moral sentiment itself.

Second, and related to the previous point, although Hume does not provide any substantial or robust theory of moral capacity, it is possible to find, within what he provides, material that suggests a less “rationalistic” understanding of moral capacity. It may be argued, for example, that in Hume’s system there is an intimate and important relationship between moral sense and virtue. Our moral sense should be understood in terms of our general capacity to feel and direct moral sentiments at both ourselves and at others. Hume points out that children acquire the artificial virtues, involving the conventions of justice, by way not only of learning their advantages but also learning to feel the relevant moral sentiments when these conventions are violated (T 3.2.3.26/500–01). The mechanism of the moral sentiments both cultivates and maintains the artificial virtues. Hume has less to say about the role of moral sentiment in relation to the natural virtues but similar observations would seem to apply. As children grow up and mature they become increasingly aware that their qualities of character affect both others and themselves and that these will inevitably give rise to moral sentiments in the people they will deal with. This entire process of becoming aware of the moral sentiments of others, and “surveying ourselves as we appear to others” (T 3.3.1.8, 3.3.1.26, 3.3.1.30, 3.3.6.6/576–7, 589, 591, 620; EM 9.10, App. 4.3/276, 314) surely serves to develop the natural as well as the artificial virtues. Along these lines, Hume maintains that this disposition to “survey ourselves” and seek our own “peace and satisfaction” is the surest guardian of every virtue (EM 9.10/276). Any person who entirely lacks this disposition will be shameless and will inevitably lack all the virtues that depend on moral reflection for their development and stability.

If this conjecture regarding the intimate or internal relationship between virtue and moral sense is correct, then it does much to explain and account for the range of exemptions that are required in this area. Hume’s understanding of the operation of moral sentiment is not simply a matter of enjoying pleasant and painful feelings of a peculiar kind (T 3.1.2.4/472). On the contrary, the moral evaluation of character involves the activity of both reason and sentiment. The sort of intellectual activities required include not only learning from experience the specific pleasant and painful tendencies of certain kinds of character and conduct, as well as the ability to distinguish accurately among them, but also the ability to evaluate character and conduct from “some steady and general point of view” (T 3.3..15/581–2; EM 5.41–2/227–8). Clearly, then, insofar as the cultivation and stability of virtue depends on moral sense, it also requires the intellectual qualities and capacities involved in the exercise of moral sense. (One way of understanding this is to say that moral sense and moral reflection serve as the counterparts to practical wisdom or phronesis in Aristotle’s moral theory. See Russell, 2006.) Given this, an animal, an infant, or an insane person will lack the ability to perform the intellectual tasks involved in the production of moral sentiment. We cannot, therefore, expect virtues that are dependent on these abilities and intellectual activities to be manifest in individuals who lack them, or when they are damaged or underdeveloped.

Interpreting Hume in these terms not only serves to fill what looks like a large gap in his naturalistic program, it also avoids distorting his own wider ethical commitments by imposing a narrower, rationalistic conception of moral capacity into his naturalistic framework. Beyond this, interpreting moral capacity in these more sentimentalist terms is both philosophically and psychologically more satisfying and plausible. On an account of this kind, there exists a close and essential relationship between being responsible, where this is understood in terms of being an appropriate target of moral sentiments or reactive attitudes, and being able to hold oneself and others responsible, where this is understood as the ability to experience and entertain moral sentiments. It is a merit of Hume’s system, so interpreted, that it avoids “over-intellectualizing” not only what is involved in holding a person responsible, but also what is involved in being a responsible agent.

6. Free Will and the Problem of Religion

In the Treatise, as was noted earlier, Hume argues that one of the reasons “why the doctrine of liberty [of indifference] has generally been better receiv’d in the world, than its antagonist [the doctrine of necessity], proceeds from religion, which has been very unnecessarily interested in this question” (T 2.3.2.3/409). He goes on to argue “that the doctrine of necessity, according to my explication of it, is not only innocent, but even advantageous to religion and morality”. When Hume came to present his views afresh in the Enquiry (Sec. 8), he was less circumspect about his hostile intentions with regard to “religion”. In the parallel passage (EU 8.26/96–97), he again objects to any effort to refute a hypothesis “by a pretence to its dangerous consequences to religion and morality”. He goes on to say that his account of the doctrines of liberty and necessity “are not only consistent with morality, but are absolutely essential to its support” (EU 8.26/97). By this means, he makes it clear that he is not claiming that his position is “consistent” with religion. In the final passages of the Enquiry discussion of liberty and necessity (EU 8.32–6/99–103) – passages which do not appear in the original Treatise discussion – Hume makes it plain exactly how his necessitarian principles have “dangerous consequences for religion”.

Hume considers the following objection:

It may be said, for instance, that, if voluntary actions be subjected to the same laws of necessity with the operations of matter, there is a continued chain of necessary causes, pre-ordained and pre-determined, reaching from the original cause of all to every single volition of every human creature… . The ultimate Author of all our volitions is the Creator of the world, who first bestowed motion on this immense machine, and placed all beings in that particular position, whence every subsequent event, by an inevitable necessity, must result. Human action, therefore, either can have no moral turpitude at all, as proceeding from so good a cause; or if they have any turpitude, they must involve our Creator in the same guilt, while he is acknowledged to be their ultimate cause and author. (EU 8.32/99–100)

In other words, the doctrine of necessity produces an awkward dilemma for the theological position: Either the distinction between (moral) good and evil collapses, because everything is produced by a perfect being who intends “nothing but what is altogether good and laudable” (EU 8.33/101), or we must “retract the attribute of perfection, which we ascribe to the Deity” on the ground that he is the ultimate author of moral evil in the world.

Hume treats the first horn of this dilemma at greatest length. He draws on his naturalistic principles to show that the conclusion reached (i.e., that no human actions are evil or criminal in nature) is absurd. There are, he claims, both physical and moral evils in this world that the human mind finds naturally painful, and this affects our sentiments accordingly. Whether we are the victim of gout or of robbery, we naturally feel the pain of such evils (EU 8.34/101–2). No “remote speculations” or “philosophical theories” concerning the good or perfection of the whole universe will alter these natural reactions and responses to the particular ills and evils we encounter. Hence, even if we were to grant that this is indeed the best of all possible worlds – and Hume clearly takes the view that we have no reason to suppose that it is (D 113–4; EU 11.15–22/137–42) – this would do nothing to undermine the reality of the distinction we draw between good and evil (i.e., as experienced on the basis of “the natural sentiments of the human mind”: EU 8.35/103).

What, then, of the alternative view, that God is “the ultimate author of guilt and moral turpitude in all his creatures”? Hume offers two rather different accounts of this alternative – although he does not distinguish them properly. He begins by noting that if some human actions “have any turpitude, they must involve our Creator in the same guilt, while he is acknowledged to be their ultimate cause and author” (EU 8.32/100). This passage suggests that God is also blameworthy for criminal actions in this world, since he is their “ultimate author”. At this point, however, there is no suggestion that the particular human agents who commit these crimes (as preordained by God) are not accountable for them. In the passage that follows this is the position taken.

For as a man, who fired a mine, is answerable for all the consequences whether the train he employed be long or short; so wherever a continued chain of necessary causes is fixed, that Being, either finite or infinite, who produces the first, is likewise the author of all the rest, and must both bear the blame and acquire the praise which belong to them. (EU 8.32/100)

Hume goes on to argue that this rule of morality has even “greater force” when applied to God, since he is neither ignorant nor impotent and must, therefore, have knowingly produced those criminal actions which are manifest in the world. Granted that such actions are indeed criminal, it follows, says Hume, “that the Deity, not man, is accountable for them” (EU 8.32/100; cf. EU 8.33/101).

It is evident that Hume is arguing two points. First, if God is the creator of the world and preordained and predetermined everything that happens in it, then the (obvious) existence of moral evil is attributable to him, and thus “we must retract the attribute of perfection” which we ascribe to him. Second, if God is indeed the ultimate author of moral evil, then no individual human being is accountable for the criminal actions he performs. The second claim does not follow from the first. Moreover, it is clearly inconsistent with Hume’s general position on this subject. As has been noted, in this same context, Hume has also argued that no speculative philosophical theory can alter the natural workings of our moral sentiments. The supposition that God is the “ultimate author” of all that takes place in the world will not, on this view of things, change our natural disposition to praise or blame our fellow human beings. Whatever the ultimate causes of a person’s character and conduct, it will (inevitably) arouse a sentiment of praise or blame in other humans who contemplate it. This remains the case even if we suppose that God also deserves blame for the “moral turpitude” we find in the world. In general, then, Hume’s first formulation of the second alternative (i.e., that God must share the blame for those crimes that occur in the world) is more consistent with his naturalistic principles.

What is crucial to Hume’s polemical purpose in these passages is not the thesis that if God is the author of crimes then his human creations are not accountable for them. Rather, the point Hume is concerned to make (since he does not, in fact, doubt the inescapability of our moral accountability to our fellow human beings) is that the religious hypothesis leads to the “absurd consequence” that God is the ultimate author of sin in this world and that he is, accordingly, liable to some appropriate measure of blame. Hume, in other words, takes the (deeply impious) step of showing that if God exists, and is the creator of the universe, then he is no more free of sin than human beings are. According to Hume, we must judge God as we judge human beings, on the basis of his effects in the world, and we must then adjust our sentiments accordingly. Indeed, there is no other natural or reasonable basis on which to found our sentiments toward God. In certain respects, therefore, we can make better sense of how we (humans) can hold God accountable than we can make sense of how God is supposed to hold humans accountable (i.e., since we have no knowledge of his sentiments, or even if he has any; cf. D 58,114,128–9; ESY 594; but see also LET I/51). It is, of course, Hume’s considered view that it is an egregious error of speculative theology and philosophy to suppose that the universe has been created by a being that bears some (close) resemblance to humankind. The question of the origin of the universe is one that Hume plainly regards as beyond the scope of human reason (see, e.g., EU 1.11–2;11.15–23;11.26–7;12.2634/11–13, 137–42, 144–47, 165; D 36–8,88–9,107). Nevertheless, Hume’s point is plain: On the basis of the (limited) evidence that is available to us, we must suppose that if there is a God, who is creator of this world and who orders all that takes place in it, then this being is indeed accountable for all the (unnecessary and avoidable; D 107) evil that we discover in it.

Although it is evident that Hume’s discussion of free will in the first Enquiry is part of his wider critique of the Christian religion, it is nevertheless widely held that Hume’s earlier discussion “Of liberty and necessity” in the Treatise carries none of this irreligious content or significance. This view is itself encouraged by a more general understanding of the relationship between the Treatise and the first Enquiry which maintains that the Treatise lacks any significant irreligious content (because Hume “castrated” his work and removed most passages of this kind, perhaps including the passages at EU 8.32–6). On this view of things, the elements of Hume’s discussion that are common to both Treatise 2.3.1–2 and Enquiry 8 are themselves without any particular religious or irreligious significance. To show why this view is seriously mistaken would, however, take us wide of our present concerns. (For a more detailed account of Hume’s fundamental irreligious intentions throughout the Treatise see Russell, 2008 and also Russell, 2016.)

Suffice it to note, for our present purposes, that throughout his writings, Hume’s philosophical interests and concerns were very largely dominated and directed by his fundamental irreligious aims and objectives. A basic theme in Hume’s philosophy, so considered, is his effort to demystify moral and social life and release it from the metaphysical trappings of “superstition”. The core thesis of Hume’s Treatise – indeed, of his overall (irreligious or “atheistic”) philosophical outlook – is that moral and social life neither rests upon nor requires the dogmas of Christian metaphysics. Hume’s naturalistic framework for understanding moral and social life excludes not only the metaphysics of libertarianism (e.g., modes of “moral” causation by immaterial agents) but also all further theologically inspired metaphysics that generally accompanies it (i.e., God, the immortal soul, a future state, and so on). The metaphysics of religion, Hume suggests, serves only to confuse and obscure our understanding of these matters and to hide their true foundation in human nature. Hume’s views on the subject of free will and moral responsibility, as presented in the sections “Of liberty and necessity” and elsewhere in his writings, are the very pivot on which this fundamental thesis turns.

Bibliography

References to Hume’s Works

In the entry above, we follow the convention given in the Nortons’ Treatise and Beauchamp’s Enquiries: we cite Book. Part. Section. Paragraph; followed by references to the Selby-Bigge/Nidditch editions. Thus T 1.2.3.4/34: will indicate Treatise Bk.1, Pt.2, Sec.3, Para.4/ Selby-Bigge pg.34. References to Abstract [TA] are to the two editions of the Treatise mentioned above (paragraph/page). In the case of the Enquiries we cite Section and Paragraph; followed by page reference to the Selby-Bigge edition. Thus EU 12.1/149 refers to Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, Sect.12, Para. 1 / Selby-Bigge pg. 149.

T A Treatise of Human Nature, edited by L. A. Selby-Bigge, 2nd ed. revised by P.H. Nidditch, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1975.
A Treatise of Human Nature, edited by David Fate Norton and Mary J. Norton, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
EU Enquiry concerning Human Understanding, in Enquiries concerning Human Understanding and concerning the Principles of Morals, edited by L. A. Selby-Bigge, 3rd edition revised by P. H. Nidditch, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1975.
Enquiry concerning Human Understanding, edited by Tom L. Beauchamp, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press, 1999.
EM Enquiry concerning the Principles of Morals, in Enquiries concerning Human Understanding and concerning the Principles of Morals, edited by L. A. Selby-Bigge, 3rd edition revised by P. H. Nidditch, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1975.
Enquiry concerning the Principles of Morals, edited by Tom L. Beauchamp, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press, 1998
ESY Essays: Moral, Political, and Literary, rev. ed. by E.F. Miller (Indianapolis: Liberty Classics, 1985).
DP “A Dissertation on the Passions” [1757], reprinted in A Dissertation of the Passions & The Natural History of Religion, edited by T.L.Beauchamp. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2007.
D Dialogues concerning Natural Religion (1779) in: Dialogues and Natural History of Religion, ed. by J.A.C. Gaskin (Oxford & New York: Oxford University Press, 1993).
LET The Letters of David Hume, edited by J.Y.T. Greig, 2 Vols., Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1932.

Secondary Literature

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  • Beebee, Helen, and Alfred Mele, 2002. “Humean Compatibilism”, Mind, 111(442): 201–223.
  • Berofsky, Bernard (ed.), 1966. Free Will and Determinism, New York & London: Harper & Row.
  • Berofsky, Bernard, 2012. Nature’s Challenge to Free Will, New York & Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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  • Bricke, John, 1988. “Hume on Freedom to Act and Personal Evaluation”, History of Philosophy Quarterly, 5: 141–56.
  • –––, 2011. “Hume on Liberty and Necessity”, in E.S. Radcliffe (ed.), A Companion to Hume, Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Buckle, Stephen, 2001. Hume’s Enlightenment Tract: The Unity and Purpose of An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, Oxford: Clarendon; Section 8 [Of Liberty and Necessity].
  • Campbell, C.A., 1951. “Is ‘Freewill’ a Pseudo-Problem?”, Mind, 60: 446–65; reprinted in Berofsky (ed.) 1966, pp. 112–35.
  • Clarke, Samuel, 1704. A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God And Other Writings, E. Vailati (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
  • Collins, Anthony, 1717. A Philosophical Inquiry Concerning Human Liberty; reprinted in J. O’Higgins (ed.), Determinism and Freewill, The Hague: Nijhoff, 1976.
  • Davidson, Donald, 1963. “Actions, Reasons, and Causes”, reprinted in Davidson 1980, pp. 3–19.
  • –––, 1973. “Freedom to Act”, reprinted in Davidson 1980, pp. 63–81.
  • –––, 1980. Actions and Events, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Dennett, Daniel, 1984. Elbow Room: The Varieties of Free Will Worth Wanting, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Fields, Lloyd, 1988. “Hume on Responsibility”, Hume Studies, 14: 161–75.
  • Flew, Antony, 1961. Hume’s Philosophy of Belief, London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
  • –––, 1984. “Paul Russell on Hume’s ‘Reconciling Project’”, Mind, 93: 587–88.
  • –––, 1986. David Hume: Philosopher of Moral Science, Oxford: Blackwell, Chapter 8 [Necessity, Liberty and the Possibility of Moral Science].
  • Frankfurt, Harry, 1971. “Freedom of the Will and the Concept of a Person”, reprinted in G. Watson (ed.), Free Will, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1982, pp. 81–95.
  • Garrett, Don, 1997. Cognition and Commitment in Hume’s Philosophy, Oxford: Oxford University Press, Chapter 6 [Liberty and Necessity].
  • Harris, James, 2005. Of Liberty and Necessity: The Free Will Debate in Eighteenth-Century British Philosophy, Oxford: Clarendon.
  • –––, 2012. “Free Will”, in A. Bailey & D. O’Brien (eds.), The Continuum Companion to Hume, London & New York: Continuum.
  • Hobbes, Thomas, 1650. The Elements of Law, F. Tonnies (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1928.
  • –––, 1651. Leviathan, R. Tuck (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991.
  • –––, 1654. Of Liberty and Necessity, selections reprinted in D.D. Raphael (ed.), British Moralists: 1650–1800 (Volume 1), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1969, pp. 61–70.
  • Kane, Robert, 2005. A Contemporary Introduction to Free Will, Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Kemp Smith, Norman, 1941. The Philosophy of David Hume, London: MacMillan, Chapter 20.
  • Locke, John, 1689 [1700]. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, 4th edition, P. Nidditch (ed.), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1975.
  • Mackie, J.L., 1977. Ethics: Inventing right and Wrong, Harmondsworth, Middlesex: Penguin.
  • McKenna, Michael, 2004. “Compatibilism”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2004 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2004/entries/compatibilism/>.
  • Millican, Peter, 2010. “Hume’s Determinism”, Canadian Journal of Philosophy. 40.4: 611–642.
  • Penelhum, Terence, 1975. Hume, London: Macmillan, Chapter 6: The Will.
  • –––, 1993. “Hume’s Moral Psychology”, in The Cambridge Companion to Hume, D.F. Norton (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992; reprinted in Penelhum 2000.
  • –––, 1998. “Critical Notice of Paul Russell, Freedom and Moral Sentiment”, Canadian Journal of Philosophy, 28: 81–94.
  • –––, 2000a. “Hume and Freedom of the Will”, in T. Penelhum 2000b.
  • –––, 2000b. Themes in Hume: The Self, the Will, Religion, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Perry, John, 2010. “Wretched Subterfuge: A Defense of the Compatibilism of Freedom and Natural Causation”, Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association, 84(2): 93–113.
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  • –––, 2016. “Hume, Free Will and Moral Responsibility”, in P. Russell (ed.), The Oxford Handbook of Hume, New York & Oxford: Oxford University Press: 380–400.
  • Reid, Thomas, 1788. Active Powers of the Human Mind, B. Brody (ed.), Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1969.
  • Russell, Paul, 1983. “The Naturalism of Hume’s ‘Reconciling Project’”, Mind, 92: 593–600.
  • –––, 1985. “Hume’s ‘Reconciling Project’: A Reply to Flew”, Mind, 94: 587–90.
  • –––, 1988. “Causation, Compulsion and Compatibilism”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 25: 313–21; reprinted in Russell 2017.
  • –––, 1990. “Hume on Responsibility and Punishment”, Canadian Journal of Philosophy, 20: 539–64; reprinted in Russell (ed.) forthcoming.
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  • –––, 2006. “Moral Sense and Virtue in Hume’s Ethics”, in T. Chappell (eds.), Values and Virtues: Aristotelianism in Contemporary Ethics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 2008. The Riddle of Hume’s Treatise: Skepticism, Naturalism. and Irreligion, Oxford & New York: Oxford University Press, Chapter 16 [Freedom Within Necessity: Hume’s Clockwork Man].
  • –––, 2013. “Hume’s Anatomy of Virtue”, in D. Russell (ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Virtue Ethics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press: 230–251; reprinted in Russell (ed.) forthcoming.
  • –––, 2015. “Hume’s ‘Lengthy Digression’: Free Will in the Treatise”, in A. Butler & D. Ainslie (eds.), The Cambridge Companion to Hume’s Treatise, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press: 230–251; reprinted in Russell (ed.) forthcoming.
  • –––, 2016. “Hume’s Philosophy of Irreligion and the Myth of British Empiricism”, in P. Russell (ed.), The Oxford Handbook of Hume, New York & Oxford: Oxford University Press; reprinted in Russell (ed.) forthcoming.
  • –––, 2017. The Limits of Free Will: Selected Essays, New York & Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • ––– , 2021. Recasting Hume and Early Modern Philosophy: Selected Essays , New York & Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Russell, Paul, and Anders Kraal, 2005 [2017]. “Hume on Religion”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy , Edward N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2017/entries/hume-religion/#RelMor/>.
  • Schlick, Moritz, 1939. ‘When is a Man Responsible?,’ David Rynin (trans.), in Problems of Ethics, New York: Prentice Hall, pp. 143–158; reprinted in Berofsky (ed.) 1966, pp. 54–63.
  • Smart, J.C.C., 1961. “Free Will, Praise and Blame”, Mind, 70: 291–306.
  • Smith, Adam, 1759. The Theory of Moral Sentiments, D.D. Raphael (ed.), Oxford: Clarendon, 1976.
  • Strawson, P.F., 1962. “Freedom and Resentment”, Proceedings of the British Academy, 48: 187–211; reprinted in P. Russell & O. Deery (eds.), The Philosophy of Free Will, New York: Oxford University Press, 2013, pp 63–83; page reference is to the reprint.
  • –––, 1985. Skepticism and Naturalism: Some Varieties, London: Metheun.
  • Stroud, Barry, 1977. Hume, London: Routledge, Chapter 7: Action, Reason and Passion.
  • Wallace, R. Jay, 1994. Responsibility and the Moral Sentiments, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Williams, Bernard, 1985. Ethics and the Limits of Philosophy, London: Fontana.
  • –––, 1993. Shame and Necessity, Berkeley: University of California Press.
  • –––, 1995. Making Sense of Humanity and Other Philosophical Papers, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.

A Brief Guide to Further Reading

The above citations may be used as the basis for further reading on this subject in the following way. Influential statements of the classical interpretation of Hume’s intentions can be found in Flew (1962), Penelhum (1975) and Stroud (1977). Prominent statements of 20th century classical compatibilism that are generally taken to follow in Hume’s tracks include Schlick (1939), Ayer (1954) and Smart (1961). Davidson (1963) provides an important statement of the causal theory of action based on broadly Humean principles. A complete statement of the naturalistic interpretation is provided in Russell (1995), esp. Part I. For a critical response to this study see Penelhum (1998; 2000a), and also the earlier exchange between Russell (1983, 1985) and Flew (1984). The contributions by Botterill (2002) and Pitson (2016) follow up on some of the issues that are at stake here. For an account of Hume’s views on punishment – a topic that is closely connected with the problem of free will – see Russell (1990) and Russell (1995 – Chp. 10). For a general account of the 18th century debate that Hume was involved in see Harris (2005) and Russell (2008), Chap. 16. See also O’Higgins introduction [in Collins (1717)] for further background. The works by Hobbes, Locke, Clarke and Collins, as cited above, are essential reading for an understanding of the general free will debate that Hume was involved in. Smith (1759) is a valuable point of contrast in relation to Hume’s views, insofar as Smith develops a naturalistic theory of responsibility based on moral sentiment (which Strawson follows up on). However, Smith does not discuss the free will issue directly (which is itself a point of some significance). In contrast with this, Reid (1788) is perhaps Hume’s most effective and distinguished contemporary critic on this subject and his contribution remains of considerable interest and value. With respect to Hume’s views on free will as they relate to his more general irreligious intentions see Russell (2008 – esp. Chp. 16). Similar material is covered in Russell (2016). Garrett (1997) provides a lucid overview and careful analysis of Hume’s views on liberty and necessity, which includes discussion of the theological side of Hume’s arguments and concerns. Helpful introductions discussing recent developments in compatibilist thinking, which are of obvious relevance for an assessment of the contemporary value of Hume’s views on this subject, can be found in McKenna (2004) and Kane (2005). Among the various points of contrast not discussed in this article, Frankfurt (1971) is an influential and important paper that aims to advance the classical compatibilist strategy beyond the bounds of accounts of freedom of action. However, as noted in the main text of this article, the work of P.F. Strawson (1962, 1985) is of particular importance in respect of the contemporary significance and relevance of Hume’s naturalistic strategy. Finally, for discussions of Hume’s compatibilism as it relates to his theory of causation see, for example, Russell (1988), Russell (1995), esp. Chaps.1–3, Beebee & Mele (2002), Harris (2005), Chap. 3, Millican (2010), and Berofsky (2012).

Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

The editors would like to thank Sally Ferguson for noticing and reporting a number of typographical errors in this entry.

Copyright © 2020 by
Paul Russell <paul.russell@ubc.ca>

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