Scottish Philosophy in the 19th Century

First published Tue Jan 29, 2002; substantive revision Fri Apr 24, 2020

Philosophical debate in 19th century Scotland was very vigorous, its agenda being set in large part by the impact of Kant and German Idealism on the philosophical tradition of the Scottish Enlightenment. The principal figures are Thomas Brown, Sir William Hamilton, James Frederick Ferrier and Alexander Bain, and later in the century, the so-called “Scottish Idealists” notably James Hutchison Stirling, Edward Caird, and D.G. Ritchie.

The self-conscious identity of the Scottish philosophical tradition owes much to James McCosh, a Scottish born and educated philosopher who became President of the College of New Jersey, later Princeton University,and straddling the 19th and 20th centuries, Andrew Seth Pringle Pattison.

1. The Enlightenment Background

While the Scottish philosophers of the 18th century are studied extensively, the philosophers who worked in Scotland's universities during the 19th century are generally neglected, and in many cases virtually unknown. Francis Hutcheson, David Hume and Thomas Reid and are names familiar to almost all philosophers; Sir William Hamilton, James Frederick Ferrier, Alexander Bain, Edward Caird and Andrew Seth to very few. Yet it is in the 19th century that something called “Scottish philosophy” came to consciousness, and gained an honored place in the international academy of its day. Across Europe and North America, and even in Australasia, for most of the 19th century Scottish philosophy was held in very high regard.It was only with the turn of the 20th century that its star fell, and did so surprisingly rapidly. To understand this decline in reputation, it is necessary to see 19th century Scottish philosophy against the background of the century that preceded it.

According to George Davie there is an

opposition…between…two contrasting positions that in their tension provided Scottish philosophy with its central problem: the Berkeleian system, according to which, in the interests of reconciling progress with traditional standards, we are to set aside the instincts of the farmer in favour of the sophistication of the philosopher and to think with the learned while we talk with the vulgar; and the Hutchesonian system, according to which, with the same aim of reconciling material advance with the intellectual principle, we are to respect the instincts of the farmer as against the sophistication of the philosopher and initiate a sort of dialogue between the vulgar and the learned, instead of talking down to the farmer from the standpoint of the philosopher. (Davie 1994, 41–2)

Cast in these terms it is easy to place the two most famous philosophers of the Scottish Enlightenment on either side of the divide. On the side of the first is Hume, whose skeptical conclusions arise from the Berkeleyan presupposition asserted in the very first sentence of his Treatise of Human Nature:

All the perceptions of the human mind resolve themselves into two distinct kinds, which I shall call impressions and ideas. The difference betwixt these consists in the degrees of force and liveliness with which they strike upon the mind. (Hume 1739, 1)

On the other side is Thomas Reid, for whom the errors of Hume result from the boldness of his starting point.

It is genius, and not the want of it, that adulterates philosophy, and fills it with error and false theory. A creative imagination disdains the mean offices of digging for a foundation, of removing rubbish, and carrying materials: leaving these servile employments to the drudges in science, it plans a design, and raises a fabric. (Reid 1764, 15)

The problem as Reid saw it was that a highly theoretical philosophy was trying to run before it could walk, because in sharp contrast to subjects that are “really sciences”—mechanics, astronomy and optics are the examples he gives—

when we turn our attention inward and consider the phaenomena of human thoughts, opinions and perceptions, and endeavour to trace them to the general laws and first principles of our constitution, we are immediately involved in darkness and perplexity. And if common sense, or the principles of education, happen not to be stubborn, it is odds but we end in absolute skepticism. (Reid 1764, 16)

It is well known that, on Reid's analysis, Hume's skepticism derives in large part from his implicit subscription to the “way of ideas”, a conception of knowledge and experience that finds its origins in Descartes, Malebranche and Locke, and its most dramatic exposition in Berkeley who, though no skeptic, “proved by unanswerable arguments what no man in his senses could believe” (Reid 1997, 20). The antidote to such skepticism is common sense, but not of the robust sort displayed by Dr. Johnson when he purported to refute Berkeley by kicking a stone. “Common sense” can mean two things, in fact: widespread popular conviction on the one hand, or on the other, the basic principles at work in human reasoning and belief formation. Widespread conviction can be false, of course, which is why the method of the School of Common Sense was thought suspect by many, described by Kant, for example, as a stratagem by which “the stalest windbag can confidently take up with the soundest thinker” (Kant 1783, 259]). But in Reid at any rate, philosophical inquiry into the human mind is not a matter of making popular opinion the test of truth, but of initiating a “dialogue between the vulgar and the learned” (to repeat Davie's happy phrase) in which proper weight is attached to actual minds at work.

There is, then, this deep division within the philosophy of the Scottish Enlightenment, yet it occurs within a context of striking unanimity also. “Wise men now agree, or ought to agree in this, that there is but one way to the knowledge of nature's works; the way of observation and experiment” Reid writes (Reid 1764, 11), thereby endorsing the express intention of Hume to “introduce the experimental method of reasoning into moral subjects” (the subtitle of the Treatise). Both remarks reflect a commitment to the project of a “science of mind”, a project common to all the major Scottish philosophers of the period. Thus George Turnbull (Reid's teacher) writing in 1740 says “I was led long ago to apply myself to the study of the human mind in the same way as to that of the human body” (quoted in Davie 1994, 24)

In short, both division and unanimity are present within eighteenth century Scottish philosophy, unanimity with respect to aim—a science of mind—and division with respect to method—the “principles of common sense” versus “the way of ideas”. This is a tension, however, within only one part of 18th century Scottish philosophy, namely the philosophy of sensation and perception, and not perhaps the most influential part. The Scottish Enlightenment is in many ways more marked by the type of thinking about social and political topics that we find in Adam Smith and Adam Ferguson, as well as Hume, who in this respect take their cue from Hutcheson. The example par excellence is Smith's Theory of Moral Sentiments (1759; 6th edition 1790), where the Humean ambition of countering the “books of divinity and abstruse metaphysics” (Treatise) was furthered by a sympathetic attention to how human beings in society actually are, and what social forms and political arrangements will best work to their happiness and well being.

In the 19th century, this strand of Enlightenment thinking ceased to be an important part of the philosophical agenda. That agenda was dominated, rather, by the “science of mind” more narrowly conceived, that is to say logic (i.e., the philosophy of truth and reason) and the philosophy of perception.

2. Thomas Brown (1778–1820)

From 1810 onwards, when Thomas Brown (1778–1820) took up the Chair of Moral Philosophy at Edinburgh, the story of Scottish philosophy is that of repeated attempts to resolve the tension that lay within that “science of mind”. It is also a story of remarkable institutional continuity. Brown was a student of Dugald Stewart (1753–1828), who in turn was a student and friend of Reid and, having taught briefly at Glasgow, held the Chair of Moral Philosophy at Edinburgh. This continuity was sustained throughout most of the succeeding century as the students of Scottish professors themselves became Scottish professors, often moving between the four ancient universities. This was especially notable in the case of the Logic Chair in Edinburgh, where Hamilton was succeeded by Campbell Fraser, Fraser by Andrew Seth, and Seth by Norman Kemp Smith, a succession of professor/student stretching from 1836–1945.

Stewart was enormously highly thought of in his own day, and had a European-wide reputation. At the time of his death he was described as ‘the pride and ornament of Scotland’, and a striking monument to him was erected on Edinburgh's Calton Hill. Yet in retrospect Stewart's thought continued the framework established by the 8th century Scots, and arguably made no notably innovative contribution to the central debate in Scottish philosophy. It was Brown who took Scottish philosophy into a new phase.

Brown was a poet and physician as well as a philosopher, and a rather more independent thinker than Stewart, so much so, in fact, that Stewart regarded him as something of a traitor to the philosophy of Reid. Perhaps because of his medical background, Brown was sympathetic to Humean empiricism, and to a large extent endorsed both Hume's rejection of metaphysics and his associationist psychology. Brown's first book, published in 1798 at the early age of twenty, was a set of Observations on the Zoonomia of Erasmus Darwin. His premature death in 1820 meant that he published relatively little philosophy during his life time, though his Inquiry into the Relation of Cause and Effect revealed his sympathy for Hume. At the time of his death he left behind voluminous lectures that were posthumously published. In them he was critical of Reid, though on certain issues he may be said to have sided with Reid against Hume. In his most frequently quoted remark, however, which does not come from the lectures, he famously sought to diminish the distance between the two.

Reid bawled out that we must believe in an outward world; but added, in a whisper, we can give no reason for our belief. Hume cries out that we can give no reason for such a notion; and whispers, I own we cannot get rid of it. (Mackintosh, 1837, 346)

Brown's lectures were immensely popular with students, and on publication they were rapturously received and widely read, running through a great many editions, both in Britain and America, for several decades. Despite this popularity, after 1850 or so, they fell into total neglect. This may have been because Brown's qualified championship of Hume sat rather uncomfortably with the consensus among Scottish philosophers for most of the nineteenth century. Consequently the greatest contribution that his lectures made to philosophical debate was second hand – namely the re-interpretation and defence of Reid that they induced on the part of the most prominent philosopher of the period—Sir William Hamilton.

3. Sir William Hamilton (1788–1856)

Sir William Hamilton was a graduate of the Universities of Glasgow and Oxford. At Glasgow he studied logic and moral philosophy under George Jardine and James Mylne. Though neither published anything of significance, they both transmitted to a new generation the philosophical legacy of Reid – though not uncritically. Mylne in particular seems to have viewed Reid with detachment. In 1807 at Balliol College Oxford Hamilton held the Snell Exhibition, a scholarship that regularly allowed Scottish students of philosophy to spend time at England's oldest university, and though he found the intellectual life there uninspiring compared to Edinburgh, he gained an extensive knowledge of Aristotelianism . From 1811–21 he worked at the Scottish Bar (with limited success) until being appointed Professor of Universal and Civil History at the University of Edinburgh, where he transferred to the Chair of Logic and Metaphysics in 1836, a post he held until his death in 1856.

At the height of his powers, Hamilton was regarded as a major intellectual figure of international importance. In a memoir, Noah Porter, President of Yale, records that in America Hamilton “was regarded as the greatest writer and teacher among living Englishmen [sic!]”. Further evidence of this towering stature lies in the fact that a volume on Hamilton was included in the series Philosophical Classics, edited by William Knight, Professor of Moral Philosophy at St Andrews. The inclusion ranked him alongside Descartes, Berkeley, Locke, Kant and Hegel. Such an estimation must now strike us as strange, yet there is point in asking why his times regarded him in such a favorable light. The answer has several sources. First there was his personal charisma and enormous erudition—‘possibly the most learned Scot that ever lived’ according to Alexander Campbell Fraser, his successor in the Chair at Edinburgh. Secondly, (as Porter records) by the early 19th century, a measure of intellectual exhaustion had set in in philosophical circles, and this provided a ready audience for his vigorous style of writing. Thirdly, there was his almost unique knowledge of German philosophy. Thanks to two trips he made to Germany during his years as a lawyer, Hamilton acquired an extensive knowledge of Kant and his immediate successors, little of which had been translated into English but which Hamilton was able to read in the original language. At the same time, he was not only thoroughly versed in the Scottish tradition of philosophy that he had acquired from Jardine and Mylne, but an enthusiastic exponent of Reid, whose collected works he edited and annotated extensively. He was thus perfectly placed to broaden the horizons of Scottish philosophy, to push it beyond the narrower confines of Common Sense by bringing to wider attention the importance of Kant, while doing so as one profoundly sympathetic to the native tradition. It is precisely for these reasons, in fact, that he is praised by John Veitch in the Philosophical Classics volume devoted to his philosophy.

Hamilton's published relatively little during his lifetime, and though two volumes of lectures appeared after his death, his philosophical views can be adequately ascertained from three long essays that he wrote for the Edinburgh Review—“The Philosophy of the Unconditioned” (1829), “The Philosophy of Perception” (1830) and “Logic” (1833), subsequently republished in a collection of his papers. In the first of these Hamilton recounts the course philosophy had taken in France after “the philosophy of Descartes and Malebranche had sunk into oblivion” (Hamilton 1853, 2). It began with the emergence of a highly materialist version of Lockean empiricism “a doctrine so melancholy in its consequences, and founded on principles thus partial and exaggerated, [that it] could not be permanent” (ibid., 3). Rescue came from two sources. The first of these was the Scottish Philosophy of Common Sense which showed that there are mental phenomena that cannot be interpreted as any form of sensation and that “intelligence supposes principles, which, as conditions of its activity, cannot be the results of its operation” (ibid., 3 emphasis original). The other source of renewal was German philosophy after Kant, and in particular the Absolute Idealism that was “founded by Fichte, but evolved by Schelling” (ibid., 6). “The Philosophy of the Unconditioned” is ostensibly a review of Victor Cousin's Course de Philosophie, which had been published in Paris the previously year (1828), but the ‘review’ is chiefly important in its providing an occasion for Hamilton to formulate his own solution to the tension between the philosophy of common sense and the way of ideas.

The question at issue can be expressed in a number of different ways. Kant held that we can only have knowledge of phenomena, never of noumena or things in themselves. Clearly this version of phenomenalism, though in many ways the antithesis of empiricism, has elements in common with the “way of ideas” to which Reid objected, which holds that the mind apprehends the world indirectly, through “impressions”. The alternative position, referred to in the 19th century as “presentationism” is often called “direct realism” and holds, as Reid contends, that we directly apprehend the world of real things. Both positions have their difficulties. Those who followed Kant, notably Fichte and Schelling, sought to escape the “scandal” of unknowable things-in-themselves, and those who followed Reid sought to overcome the contention implicit in his approach that our knowledge of the world is “conditioned” by the principle of common sense. Hence the pursuit of a philosophy of the “unconditioned”.

Hamilton argues that the age-old search for a philosophy of the unconditioned is futile, and he contends that what is in effect a combination of phenomenalism and presentationism will supply everything that a properly grounded understanding of reality requires. In “The Philosophy of Perception” he engages in the debate by defending Reid against criticisms in Thomas Brown's posthumously published Lectures, and in a very vigorous manner—“It is always unlucky to stumble on the threshold. The paragraph (Lect. xxvii) in which Dr Brown opens his attack on Reid contains more mistakes than sentences” (ibid. 69). Brown claimed that a close analysis of Reid's writings showed that his position on perception was not really that of direct realism but “hypothetical realism”, that is the belief in an external world that cannot be known directly. It is this contention that Hamilton aims to refute, but it is arguable that he misinterprets Brown. Moreover in his notes to Reid's Collected Works, which were composed rather later, he appears to come round to something very like Brown's interpretation and to hold that Reid was not, strictly speaking, a direct realist after all.

If we construe Reid as holding that in the act of perception there are three elements—the physiological modification of the organ, a mental sensation and the perception of an object—then we can contrast this with Hamilton's position which holds that the mental sensation and the perception are simultaneous and in a sense two sides of the same coin. Reid holds, of course, that we do not reason from sensation to perception; the apprehending mind moves from one to the other by a natural, inbuilt instinct—one of the principles of common sense. Hamilton too holds that there is no reasoning process here, but he also thinks that the continuing division that Reid is employing between sensation and perception is incompatible with the idea of immediate perception or direct realism. Hence his amendment, which so to speak ties the sensation and perception together. But how is this further contention to be sustained? Is it a conceptual truth of some kind, or an empirical observation about how the mind works? Hamilton's writings in general tend to assertion more than argument, and while he has a great deal to say on this point, it does seem that his “solution” to the problem of perception is an arbitrary stipulation designed to overcome it. At any rate, if we do press the question of its defence, we quickly encounter a new version of the old division, namely whether the perception is to be identified as a manifestation of self-evident principles of common sense, or as a psychological association of ideas. In this sense Hamilton's thesis is still set within the fundamental parameters of the Hume/Reid debate.

At the time of his death, Hamilton's philosophical endeavors were widely regarded as offering the most profound treatment to date of some of philosophy's deepest and most perennial problems. This estimation did not persist for long. Two devastating attacks, from strikingly different philosophical perspectives, appeared in print within a decade. The best known of these was John Stuart Mill's Examination of Sir William Hamilton's Philosophy (1865). Mill's two volume work constituted a detailed and highly critical examination of Hamilton's philosophical contentions (as well as his excursions into logic) largely from the point of view of empiricism in general, and empirical psychology in particular. In the same year, the Scottish philosopher Hutchison Stirling, in Sir William Hamilton: Being the Philosophy of Perception an Analysis published the first (and ultimately only) part of an equally strenuous attack from an Idealist point of view. Hamilton's defenders leapt into print, notably the Oxford philosopher H L Mansel (whom Mill had also attacked) and John Veitch, Hamilton's student and amanuensis. James McCosh, then Professor of Logic at Belfast, also joined the fray with An Examination of Mr J S Mill's Philosophy (1866), though this was much more an attack on Mill than a defence of Hamilton.

Despite these vigorous voices, Hamilton's philosophical reputation declined rapidly. In terms of the tradition of Scottish philosophy, however, it was not Mill who mattered most, but Hamilton's student and friend James Frederick Ferrier. It was Ferrier who strove most obviously, in the name of Scottish philosophy, to take a different tack from both Reid and Hamilton.

4. James Frederick Ferrier (1808–1864)

Though the expression “Scottish philosophy” came to be ever more widely used in the second half of the 19th century, its first appearance was in the title of a privately printed pamphlet by J.F. Ferrier—Scottish Philosophy, the Old and the New (1854). Ferrier chose this title because his pamphlet was expressly written in defence of the contention that it is possible to engage in something called “Scottish philosophy” while departing radically from the tenets of Reid, Stewart and so on. Ferrier writes with great force and feeling.

It has been asserted, that my philosophy is of Germanic origin and complexion. A broader fabrication than that never dropped from human lips or dribbled from the point of a pen. My philosophy is Scottish to the very core; it is national in every fibre and articulation of its frame. It is a natural growth of old Scotland's soil and has drunk in no nourishment from any other land. Are we to judge the productions of Scotland by merely looking to what Scotland has hitherto produced? May a philosopher not be, heart and soul, a Scotsman—may he not be a Scotsman in all his intellectual movements, even though he should have the misfortune to differ in certain respects, from Dr Reid and Sir William Hamilton (Ferrier 1854, 12)

The explanation of the feeling with which Ferrier writes lies in the fact his little book is a response to the charge levelled against him in the contest for Hamilton's Chair of Logic and Metaphysics at Edinburgh (then still in the gift of the Town Council), when he was accused by the Free Church party of departing from “the Scottish philosophy” in favour of some sort of Hegelianism. This charge was almost certainly motivated by the ecclesiastical rivalries generated by the Disruption in the Church of Scotland that took place in 1843, but it is nonetheless true that Ferrier expressly denounces a certain conception of “Common Sense” philosophy, and one which he identifies closely with Reid. Indeed he is not afraid to repeat his objections in his defence of himself.

Suppose we are discussing the subject of salt, and that we say “salt is white and gritty, it is in some degree moist, it is sometimes put into a salt cellar and placed on the dinner table…”…No man would be considered much of a chemist, who was merely acquainted with these and other such circumstances, concerning salt.…So, in philosophy, no man can be called a philosopher who merely knows and says, that he and other people exist, that there is an external world, that a man is the same to day as he was yesterday, and so forth. These are undoubtedly truths, but I maintain that they are not truths in philosophy, any more than those just mentioned are truths in chemistry. Our old Scottish school, however, is of a different way of thinking. It represents these and similar facts as the first truths of philosophy, and to these it has recourse in handling the deeper questions of metaphysics. I have no objections to this, for those who like it—only my system deals with first truths of a very different order; and it denies that the first truths of the old Scottish school are truths in philosophy at all. This is one very fundamental point of difference between the old and the new Scottish system of metaphysics (ibid., 7)

It is important to note that Ferrier thinks this castigation of one version of “Common Sense” philosophy is quite compatible with claiming the right to be the inheritor of, though not restricted by, the programme of Reid and Hamilton. And there are indeed several points of contact to be observed. The first is this. Ferrier shares with Hamilton a largely unspoken assumption that the question of mind and world lies at the heart of philosophy. This assumption signalled a move away from the much broader conception of moral philosophy as both psychological and social inquiry, which as we have already noted, is characteristic of Ferguson, Hume, Adam Smith, and even Reid in part. Second, and more importantly perhaps, Ferrier's own philosophical reflections continue to fit Davie's description of Scottish philosophy as a “dialogue between the vulgar and the learned”.

Ferrier's reputation rested upon an earlier series of essays on The Philosophy of Consciousness which appeared in Blackwood's Magazine between 1838 and 1843. In these essays he took his stand on the contention that consciousness implies the impossibility of a naturalistic science of mind, and in a later essay robustly defends a version of Berkeleyan idealism. While Reid thought that Berkeley's philosophical position was one that “no man in his senses could believe”, somewhat surprisingly perhaps, Ferrier describes Berkeley as “the champion of common sense…who could have foiled the prince of skeptics at his own weapons” (Ferrier 1865, 301). “Among all philosophers ancient or modern, we are acquainted with none who presents fewer vulnerable points that Bishop Berkeley. His language it is true, has sometimes the appearance of paradox; but there is nothing paradoxical in his thoughts, and time has proved the adamantine solidity of his principles.” (ibid. p. 291) By Ferrier's account, Berkeley settles the issue of sensation and perception with which Hamilton struggled, by seeing that there is a false abstraction here.

The external world in itself, and the external world in relation to us, was a philosophic distinction which he [Berkeley] refused to recognize. In his creed, the substantive and phenomenal were one. And though he has been accused of sacrificing the substance to the shadow, and though he still continues to be charged, by every philosophical writer, with reducing all things to ideas in the mind, he was guilty of no such absurdity…There does not appear to be much justice in the ordinary allegation, that Berkeley discredited the testimony of the senses, and denied the existence of the material universe. He merely denied the distinction between things and their appearances, and maintained that the thing was the appearance and the appearance was the thing. (ibid., 302–3 emphasis original)

On this interpretation Berkeley espouses a sort of idealism but

genuine idealism, looking only to the fact, and instructed by the unadulterated dictates of common sense, denies…that we can separate in thought objects and perceptions at all; hence this system has nothing whatever to do either with the preservation or the destruction of the material universe; and hence, too, it is identical…with genuine unperverted realism. (ibid., 309 emphasis original)

In this way Ferrier, despite his disagreements, actually concurs with Reid's strictures on the kind of philosophical theorizing that tries to deploy Newtonian methods in the way that Hume does. Indeed, Ferrier thinks that “the inert and lifeless character of modern philosophy is ultimately attributable to her having degenerated into a physical science” (ibid., 191), and he condemns the resulting “picture of man” as “a wretched association machine, through which ideas pass linked only by laws over which the machine has no control” (ibid., 196). His alternative to this externalist conception of “the science of mind” is a return to the introspective examination of human consciousness. “Consciousness is philosophy nascent; philosophy is consciousness in full bloom and blow. The difference between them is only one of degree, and not one of kind; and thus all conscious men are to a certain extent philosophers, although they may not know it” (ibid., 197) In short, the proper engagement of philosophy is a matter of bringing consciousness to a better understanding of itself, which is at least one interpretation of the ambition of Reid's Inquiry.

Ferrier's philosophy, then, can be construed as both importantly different to Reid's, and at the same time another exploration in the common sense tradition. For Reid, Berkeley is the principal architect of “the way of ideas”, and hence though not himself a skeptic, the purveyor of a philosophy that makes radical skepticism inevitable. In sharp contrast, for Ferrier, Berkeley's philosophy (with some additions of Ferrier's own) is the answer to skepticism. By rejecting the philosophers' invention of 'matter', Berkely means to affirm common sense. It hardly needs to be said that this construction of Berkeley was a highly controversial position. Moreover, it throws the whole subject of mind and consciousness back into the realms of metaphysical philosophy and hence seems to abandon the shared methodological assumption that, to quote Reid again, “there is but one way to the knowledge of nature's works; the way of observation and experiment” a supposition he wholeheartedly shared with Hume. This implication—that the methods of the sciences are inapplicable to philosophy—somewhat isolated Ferrier within Scottish philosophy. Though he was regarded with great acclaim in continental Europe, Scottish philosophers moved in different directions, some to an intensification of the experimental method, and some to Absolute Idealism. Of the first group, the most prominent and influential was Alexander Bain.

5. Alexander Bain (1818–1903)

Alexander Bain was Regius Professor of Logic at the University of Aberdeen from 1860 to 1880. A man of remarkable gifts, he was appointed to the Chair largely on the strength of distinguished philosophical work he had published while working as a journalist in London. It was there that he made the acquaintance of John Stuart Mill with whom he formed a lasting friendship. Dissertations on Leading Philosophical Questions (1903), is a collection of his essays published in retirement, though almost all had originally appeared in the journal Mind, a journal he was instrumental in founding, In several of these essays, Bain takes Reid and Hamilton as his starting point and, broadly, follows the same methods. But, his sympathy with Mill and anti-metaphysical inclinations led him to push them in a much more strongly empirical direction. The most interesting of his Dissertations, in this connection, is entitled “Associationist Controversies” and at the heart of these controversies we can find a distinction between philosophy and psychology that both reveals the significant difference between Bain and Ferrier, and establishes the discipline of experimental psychology in its own right.

We are, at the moment, in the midst of a conflict of views as to the priority of Metaphysics and Psychology. If indeed the two are closely identified as some suppose, there is no conflict; there is in fact, but one study. If, on the other hand, there are two subjects, each ought to be carried on apart for a certain length, before they can either confirm or weaken each other. I believe that in strictness, a disinterested Psychology should come first in order, and that, after going on a little way in amassing the facts, it should revise its fundamental assumptions…I do not see any mode of attaining a correct Metaphysics until Psychology has at least made some way upon a provisional Metaphysics (Bain 1903, 38)

Bain can be interpreted as a practitioner of the “science of mind” no less than Reid or Hume. But whereas in Reid and Hume (and Ferrier) the distinction between philosophy and psychology as the modern world understands it, was unclear, it is one of Bain's chief claims to enduring significance that, as this quotation reveals, he brought the distinction between psychological and metaphysical questions to prominence, and in what would now be called his research programme he gave priority to the former. The conclusion to be drawn is that Bain, like Ferrier, can be seen to stand in the tradition of Scottish philosophy in the sense that he adopted its methods. But in contrast to Ferrier, he did so in ways that further removed the question of sensation and perception from the realms of traditional metaphysics, and pressed the study of the mind in the direction of empirical psychology.

One notable feature of this development lies in the fact that Bain was one of the principal exponents and defenders of “associationism”, whose origins, arguably, are to be found most clearly in Hume's Treatise. Associationism is the application of empirical observation to the relation between ideas and experiences. What it seeks is observed regularities, in the hope of formulating psychological laws that will enable us to order the contents of mind. Two such principles—Contiguity and Similarity—were widely accepted, and identified by Bain as being employed by Reid and Hamilton. A third—Contrast—was more disputable, and in “Associationist Controversies” Bain is principally concerned with the nature and identifiable independence of principles such as these.

However, in the present context his arguments are chiefly interesting not so much for their elaboration of associationism, as for the light they throw on the development of Scottish philosophy in the nineteenth century. One point in particular seems to me illuminating. In the dispute between Reid and Hume with respect to the operations of the mind one of the fundamental points of difference is this. Reid is trying, in the main, to establish basic principles of the mind's operation which will vindicate its rationality, and hence avoid the depths of skepticism into which Hume's account forces it. Hume, on the contrary, declares that “reason is nothing but a wonderful and unintelligible instinct in our souls which carries us along a certain train of ideas…[and that this] habit is nothing but one of the principles of nature, and derives all its force from that origin” (Hume 1888, 179), Reid's purpose is precisely to show that the basic operations of the mind are more than psychological regularities. They are exercises of intelligibility. Now in terms of this difference, Bain is of Hume's persuasion. This is revealed not merely in his striking deployment of decidedly Humean terminology when, for instance, he contrasts the perception and the memory of a thing in terms of “vividness” (Bain 1903, 42). It is even more evident when he asserts that “The flow of representations in dreaming and madness offers the best field of observation for the study of associations as such” (ibid., 45).

What this remark reveals is that Bain is interested first in establishing empirical laws with respect to the contents of the human mind. The reason that he thinks dreaming and madness are the best places to start is precisely because he sees that the pursuit of rational principles, that is to say, philosophically coherent principles, is likely to distort our observation by inclining us to see rational connections rather than empirical associations, or as he puts it “associations as such”. In this respect he is employing Hume's rather than Reid's conception of human nature. Certainly he reserves judgement on the final outcome of these investigations with respect to philosophy, arguing only for the priority of psychology over metaphysics and not, as Hume may be said to do, for the elimination of the second by the first. But so far as the science of mind that had been such a marked feature of Scottish philosophy goes, Bain clearsightedly pursues its more empirical ambitions.

For Ferrier the empirical laws of association that Bain seeks are not “truths in philosophy”. No one can be called a philosopher who merely knows and says, that in dreaming or madness this mental representation tends to be associated with that. The philosopher aspires, rather, to make sense of experience, and the whole point about the experience of the dreamer or the madman is that no sense is to be made of it. By contrast, the empirical psychologist, seriously committed to the experimental method, does not, in the end, render consciousness intelligible; he or she simply describes how the mind works.

With Ferrier and Bain, then, the tension within Scottish philosophy that Davie has identified is resolved in radically different ways, the first by a return to metaphysics, the second by an advance to psychology. Both can claim to be inheritors of the Scottish tradition, and yet both, in quite different ways, may be said to have implied its demise. With Bain, the nature of the demise is evident; the philosophy of mind is replaced by empirical psychology. With Ferrier, the nature of the demise is rather different. Faced with the prospect of returning to Berkeleyan metaphysics, several prominent Scottish philosophers preferred to look elsewhere, namely to Germany and Hegel. The result was that as the century ended a group of philosophers based chiefly in the Universities of Glasgow and St Andrews and known as the Scottish Idealists came to prominence.

6. The Scottish Idealists

In his illuminating study Scottish Philosophy, importantly subtitled A comparison of the Scottish and German answers to Hume, and the first of two sets of Balfour Lectures, Andrew Seth remarks:

The thread of national tradition, it is tolerably well known, has been but loosely held of late by many of our best Scottish students of philosophy. It will hardly be denied that the philosophical productions of the younger generation of our University men are more strongly impressed with a German than with a native stamp (Seth Pringle-Pattison 1885, 1–2)

Seth does not say who it is he has in mind, but a knowledge of the period makes it relatively easy to surmise. In fact Seth himself (he changed his name to Seth Pringle-Pattison in 1898) was for a time identified as one in virtue of being joint editor with R B Haldane of Essays in Philosophical Criticism (1883). This volume came to be regarded as the Scottish Idealists' philosophical manifesto, though Seth in his second set of Balfour Lectures Hegelianism and Personality registered a fundamental disagreements with the Idealists. The reference to “a German stamp”, however, may be somewhat misleading. An interest in, and a knowledge of, Kant can be found to go back to Hamilton, and far from being regarded as a threat to the Scottish tradition was recognized (by Veitch, for instance) as an important part of its enrichment. The German philosophy referred to here, then, is that which emanated from Hegel.

The Secret of Hegel is the title of a very large book by James Hutchison Stirling (Hamilton's Idealist critic), first published in 1864. Stirling is credited with bringing Hegel to the attention of British (and not just Scottish) philosophy for the first time, though a wit at the time remarked that if Stirling did know the secret of Hegel, he had kept it to himself! Though Stirling was, in modern terms, a layman (he held no university post) the book was well received. Combined with his critical volume on Hamilton (published just one year later), Stirling's work was a key to the diminishing interest in the Common Sense tradition within Scottish philosophy and the increasing influence of German Idealism and Hegel in particular, a development that may be said to have culminated in the first complete English translation of Hegel's Phenomenology of Spirit in 1910 by J.B. Baillie, Regius Professor of Moral Philosophy at the University of Aberdeen.

Of the Scottish Idealists the most prominent and influential was Edward Caird (1835–1908). A graduate of the University of Glasgow, after a period at Oxford he returned in 1866 to become Glasgow's Professor of Moral Philosophy, a post he held for almost 30 years, before returning to Oxford to become Master of Balliol. Caird was an admirer of Kant, but believed that Kant had failed to capitalize fully on his own insights, and that the real import of his philosophy could be uncovered with the help of Hegel. The aim of philosophy, on this interpretation, was the ultimate reconciliation of seemingly incompatible elements in human experience—religion and science, freedom and causality, reason and desire, for instance, but above all and at its most abstract, subject and object (or mind and body). The employment of these distinctions is essential to making human experience intelligible, but once they are held to be absolute error and confusion arises. Materialism makes the distinction between mind and body absolute and seeks to explain the former in terms of the latter; Cartesianism works in reverse. Both result in rendering the relation mysterious.

The solution lies in the Hegelian perception that our knowledge is perfected when its objects are conceived as parts of a whole, ultimately the Absolute. This way of understanding, however, is not something to be accomplished simply. Human understanding evolves as human experience increases and our knowledge expands. Accordingly, Caird and the other Scottish Idealists, especially David Ritchie at St Andrews, welcomed the growth of natural science, and especially biology, as providing important new material for the further evolutionary development of human understanding as a whole.

Three consequent problems can be said to have occupied them chiefly. The first was to avoid the charge of “mentalism” or “panpsychism”. The Idealist contention that materialism is false leads easily to the counter accusation that the world is made of mental stuff. This charge is often leveled at Berkeley, interest in whom greatly increased among Scottish philosophers at this time. Alexander Campbell Fraser, Professor of Logic and Metaphysics at the University of Edinburgh, though not himself an Idealist in philosophy,became editor of a new collected edition of Berkeley's works. Ferrier, Fraser and Seth all denied that Berkeley's immaterialism amounts to mentalism, but it became common to distinguish between “subjective Idealism” and “Absolute Idealism”, the latter being the doctrine the Scottish Idealists espoused.

Appeal to “The Absolute”, however, brings another danger—a threat to the reality of individual finite minds. There is a risk that the individual subject is reduced to a modification of the one Absolute universal mind, and hence eliminated as an independently existing centre of consciousness. This was the principal reason that led Seth to conclude against Hegelianism in his second set of Balfour Lectures, and he identified it as a problem that the other Idealists (notably Caird) failed to avoid.

The third issue is religion. How does “the Absolute” relate to “God”? This was not simply a question internal to Idealist philosophy, but of far wider cultural and intellectual concern, partly because of the threat that Darwinian biology and Biblical “higher” criticism seemed to pose for Christian theism, and partly because of the rise of anthropological inquiry and the new “science of religions”. Edward Caird's brother John, a prominent churchman, Professor of Divinity at Glasgow, subsequently Principal of the University, and also an Idealist in philosophy, devoted this Croall Lectures to this topic. A more sustained opportunity to address these questions arose with the establishment in 1882 of the Gifford Lectures at the four Scottish Universities. Several series of these important lectures were given by the principal Scottish Idealists, and subsequently published—The Evolution of Religion (1891–2) by Edward Caird (widely regarded as his philosophical masterpiece), Naturalism and Agnosticism (1896–8) by J.S. Ward, and The Fundamental Ideas of Christianity (1912–13) by John Caird, are three of the most important. All of them deploy the resources of Idealist philosophy to defend a version of theism that is compatible with evolutionary biology. They do so in part by interpreting the concept of “evolution” philosophically so that both thought and religion are understood to evolve, no less than biological organism.

7. James McCosh (1811–94)

Did Scottish Idealism constitute a revitalization and continuation of the Scottish philosophical tradition, or its demise? James McCosh who published The Scottish Philosophy, Biographical, Expository, Critical, from Hutcheson to Hamilton, in 1874 had no doubt. Writing from the distant perspective of Princeton he held that the Scottish philosophy was now opposed within Scotland on two fronts—by the materialism of Bain on the one hand, and on the other, by the Hegelianism of Caird (described by George Davie as “a very untypical Scotsman and one quite exceptionally apathetic to educational customs of the country” (Davie 1961 86)).

McCosh was in a good position to make this assessment. As a student at the University of Glasgow he acquired a wide knowledge of the tradition (though this seems to have been due more to the library than the lecture hall), and later while a divinity student at Edinburgh he attended Hamilton's lectures. Ordained to the ministry of the Church of Scotland in 1834, McCosh got caught up in the conflicts that eventually led to the great Disruption of 1843, and split the national church for almost 100 years. Though he ministered faithfully for the Free church side, he also found time to continue with his philosophical studies and in 1850 published The Method of the Divine Government, Physical and Moral, a work that eventually ran to thirteen editions. On the strength of this book, McCosh was offered the Professorship of Logic and Metaphysics at the Queen's College Belfast, part of the newly created National University of Ireland. Eighteen years later he accepted the Presidency of the College of New Jersey (subsequently Princeton University) where he also taught moral philosophy, even after his retirement from the Presidency in 1888.

For McCosh, the heart of ‘the Scottish philosophy’ lay in its combination of observational methods of inquiry with moral and religious formation. “Ever since I became a teacher of the science of mind” he writes, “I have given more attention to philosophy than theology. In doing this I have been able to serve religion more effectively than any other course I could have taken” (McCosh 1896, 251). Given this account of what made the Scottish philosophy distinctive, it is easy to see why McCosh thought the philosophical schools becoming fashionable in Scotland signalled its demise. The materialism of Bain fastened on the former (observational methods) but abandoned the latter (moral formation), while the Idealism of Caird abandoned the former in the interests of the latter.

McCosh's pessimism that the combination of Realism and Theism which underlay the Scottish philosophical enterprise from Hutcheson to Hamilton had foundered within the universities of Scotland, was offset by his hope and belief that the rising cultural and intellectual independence of the United States from its European origins would constitute fertile ground for a new ‘American’ philosophy that would both continue and develop all that was best in the Scottish tradition. He proved to be quite wrong in this speculation. Two philosophies rose to prominence in America. Both of them had some connection with what came to be known a little later as the “college philosophy” that emanated from Scotland via Princeton. One was a version of Idealism that was sympathetic to theism, and the other Pragmatism, which owed something to Reidian ‘Common Sense’. Neither of them, however, was Realist, and both were soon displaced by logical positivism.

8. Andrew Seth Pringle-Pattison (1856–1931)

While McCosh regarded the division between empiricists like Bain, and Idealists such as Caird, to be largely exhaustive, he did leave open the possibility of persisting with the insights and methods of Scottish philosophy, and commended a few individuals in this respect, among them Robert Flint (1838–1910), who was Professor of Moral Philosophy at St Andrews before moving to the Chair of Divinity at Edinburgh. McCosh's list is short, and does not include Andrew Seth. Yet arguably it was Seth who, in a major work published some decades later, proved to be the most articulate exponent of the Scottish philosophical tradition, retaining the fundamentals of Scottish philosophy in a highly sophisticated form.

Though McCosh does not mention Seth, it is hard to believe that he did not know of Seth's earlier lectures on Scottish philosophy since these appeared in print before McCosh had retired from the Presidency at Princeton. In any event, there is an interesting historical connection between the two men. As President of the College of New Jersey, McCosh's vision and energy laid the foundations for its transformation from a worthy regional institution to an internationally acknowledged leader in higher education. It was in 1896, two years after McCosh's death, that this remarkable transformation was finally acknowledged in the change of name to Princeton University. Seth (by then Seth Pringle-Pattison) was invited to attend the celebrations on behalf of the University of Edinburgh, and gave two lectures on Theism.

It was twenty years later, however, before his magnum opus, The Idea of God in the Light of Recent Philosophy appeared. This book began life as Gifford Lectures delivered at the University of Aberdeen in the years 1912 and 1913. World War I (in which Seth's son Ronald fought and died) delayed both their revision and their publication. Consequently, they were not published until 1917. Lecture One begins with David Hume's Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, and taking that as his starting point, Seth proceeds to address all the issues that had long dominated philosophical debate in Scotland. These include the existence of God, the relation of mind to body, the nature and scope of science, the theory of knowledge and the problem of skepticism. The 'recent philosophy', to which the subtitle refers, is the division and debate between empirical psychology and idealistic philosophy that had taken up competing sides on these questions. The heart of Seth's strategy is to analyze the defects of of empiricism and Idealism, and then to seek an integration of the compelling philosophical insights of both. He acknowledges that the Scottish philosophical tradition is inherently naturalistic, while at the same time accepting the Idealists rejection of Hume's narrow empiricism. In Lecture V of the first series, Seth accordingly elaborates and defends what he calls 'higher' naturalism. Three elements are key to this more sophisticated version of the naturalism that united Hume and Reid. First, philosophy has to be grounded in experience. It relies on both introspection and experiment, and cannot proceed satisfactorily in the form of rationalistic deductions from a priori principles. Second, dispassionately considered, we experience different orders of mind. The mind of animals is different to the mind of human beings. In particular, the human mind exhibits moral consciousness, something wholly lacking in other creatures. This is no less a fact of experience than anything biological observation or laboratory experiments might reveal. Given these critical differences between the kinds of mind experienced in nature, it is a mistake to seek to bring all evolved creatures within the scope of a unitary causal or biological explanation. Thirdly, the perennial task of philosophy is to search for a comprehensive explanation of experience. Philosophy's proper ambition is not to be a distinctive science, but to formulate an explanatory understanding that will integrate the radical differences within experience without eliminating them. Both psychologism and Idealism, whatever other merits they may have, fail in this respect.

Seth's scope of reference, the subtlety of his arguments, his familiarity with the most recent advances in evolutionary biology and experimental psychology make The Idea of God a remarkable work. It represents a synthesis of profound learning that extended over almost half a century, from his days as a student until close to his retirement as a Professor. In his retirement Seth published two more substantial books, one of them a second set of Gifford Lectures, yet there is no doubt that The Idea of God is his finest work, and a major philosophical accomplishment by any standard. Issued by Britain's most prestigious academic publisher, the Clarendon Press at Oxford University, the book was widely reviewed and highly acclaimed at the time of its publication. Yet it did not long retain the attention it received at first, and subsequently sank into obscurity. In the last hundred years it has almost never been referred to. Given its merits, why should this be?

McCosh was correct in claiming that neither the empirical psychology of Bain, nor the Hegelian Idealism of Caird, was an adequate successor to the philosophical tradition to which, for the most part, they owed their origins. Nevertheless, both succeeded in attracting the talent and enthusiasm of a new generation of scholars, and they did so to powerful effect. Psychology became a hugely influential voice in the world of intellectual inquiry, and alongside other social 'sciences' such as sociology, economics and political science, this seemed to validate a strictly empirical approach to the study of many of the topics that had occupied the philosophers of the Scottish Enlightenment. As a result, all these new subjects, whose origins owed much to Scottish philosophy, grew in allegiance and prestige. Inevitably, this development had a philosophical effect. The new 'sciences' gave greater credibility to the empiricist epistemology that appeared to underwrite them. Meanwhile, in a similar spirit, Idealist philosophy came under attack. In 1903, the Cambridge philosopher G.E. Moore published an essay entitled “The Refutation of Idealism”. It is arguable that Moore did not understand what he was aiming to refute, but in any event his essay began a return to ascendancy by the British empiricist tradition, aided in part by the Logical Empiricism that emanated from Austria and then took root in America. In due course this spelt the end of British Idealism. For empiricists, the most significant Scottish philosopher was now identified as Hume, whose naturalism, ironically, had been importantly rehabilitated by Norman Kemp Smith, Seth's student and successor. By this time Reid's star had long been waning, and he quickly came to be forgotten. For more than fifty years, both Reid and Hegel disappeared from the curriculum and conscientiousness of philosophers in Scotland. Accordingly, two major contributors to the 'recent philosophy' that Seth took to be the relevant context of his Gifford Lectures, were silenced. Little wonder, then, that his brilliant rapprochement between these perpetually antagonistic currents in philosophical thought soon disappeared.

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