(x,F),
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[2.] Parsons (1987) has shown that when restricted to the context of first-order logic, Basic Law V is consistent. [See also Burgess (forthcoming), for a nice presentation of this result).] However, this result has somewhat limited philosophical significance. Since the membership relation can't be defined in first-order logic, the resulting notion of an extension, as axiomatized by the first-order version of Basic Law V, is a rather weak one which can do little work. Such a notion bears little resemblance to the familiar notion of a set or class.
[3.] Frege doesn't call this principle `Hume's Principle' in his own writings. The label was instead introduced in Boolos (1987). Frege did cite Hume when he introduced this principle in Gl. In Gl, §63, he quotes Hume's Treatise (I, iii, 1):
When two numbers are so combined as that one has always an unite answering to every unite of the other, we pronounce them equal.The idea in Hume does bear some resemblance to the principle Frege constructs, and so we shall continue to use Boolos' label for this principle.
[4.] We call this an implicit or contextual definition rather than an explicit definition because the notation #F can only be eliminated when it appears in a context of the form `#F = #G'. By contrast, an explicit definition would take the form:
#F =df the object x such thatwhere
(x,F) is some condition on
x and F. This would allow us to eliminate the #F
no matter in which context it appears. We shall examine Frege's
attempt to give such a definition momentarily.
The reader might also find the following observation by Demopoulos useful:
Moreover, Frege's contextual definition (i.e., Hume's Principle) is not `conservative' over the language L = {0, S, N} of second order arithmetic. (It is not conservative because it allows one to prove statements that are otherwise unprovable using this language and second-order logic alone. A proper, explicit definition only introduces simplifying notation --- the new theorems formulable with the new notation introduced by an explicit definition would still have been provable had the new notation been eliminated in terms of primitive notation. As such, explicit definitions are conservative.) Indeed, the contextual definition allows for the proof both of the infinity of the sequence of natural numbers and of the existence of an infinite cardinal (which Frege called `endlos' in Gl).[from Demopoulos (forthcoming-a)]
[5.] The reader might find the following observation by Demopoulos useful.
The characterization "Frege-Russell", nearly universal and certainly well-established, actually slurs over the fact that, from the point of view of Russell's Simple Theory of Types, the number associated with a set (the analogue, in this setting, of a concept of first level) is an entity of higher type than the set itself. Beginning with individuals -- entities of lowest type -- Russell proceeds first to sets of individuals (corresponding to Frege's first-level concepts) and thence to classes of such sets (corresponding to Frege's concepts of second level). For Russell, since numbers are classes of equinumerous sets, they are of higher type than sets. But for Frege, extensions, and therefore numbers, belong to the totality of objects whatever the level of concept with which they are associated. Thus, while Russell and Frege both subscribe to some version Hume's principle, their conceptions of the logical form of the cardinality operator, and therefore, that of the principle itself, are quite different: the operator is "type-raising" for Russell, since it takes us from a set to a class; while for Frege it is "type-lowering", since it takes a concept (set) to an object (individual). This difference is fundamental, since it enables Frege to establish -- on the basis of Hume's principle -- those of the Peano-Dedekind axioms of arithmetic which assert that the system of natural numbers is, in Dedekind's phrase, "simply infinite" (Dedekind infinite). By contrast, when the cardinality operator is type raising, Hume's principle is rather weak, allowing for models of every finite power. (See Bell (1996) and Boolos (1994) for further discussion of these matters.)[from Demopoulos (forthcoming-a)]
[6.] The higher-order version of
the Law of Extensions asserts that a concept G is a member of
the extension of the second-order concept concept equinumerous to
F iff G is equinumerous to F. If we temporarily
suppose that the variable 
can be used a
variable ranging over concepts, then we could represent the extension
of the second-order concept just described as:
Then, the higher-order law of extensions would be formalizable as follows:(
F)
GThis principle is used implicitly on several occasions in the derivation of Hume's Principle in Gl. Those readers who read the material on the derivation of Hume's Principle in Gg will see that this principle gets reformulated as the Lemma to the Proof of Hume's Principle.
G
[7.] Strictly speaking, we should represent this concept as follows:
[But we have applied the following instance ofz [
r]
-Conversion to the first conjunct within the matrix
of the -expression:
[We thereby simplify the entire expression to:
[
[8.] The Facts numbered 3, 4, 5, and 6 correspond to Theorems 124, 129, 123, and 128, respectively, in Gg I. Facts 1, 6, and 7 correspond to Propositions 91, 84, and 98, respectively, in Part III of Begr.
[9.] Facts 2, 3, 5, and 6 correspond to Theorems 134, 132, 141, and 144, respectively, in Gg I.
[10.] See the work by Wright cited in the Bibliography for a defense of something like this position. Wright justifies this position on Fregean grounds by appealing to Frege's Context Principle, which asserts that a word has no meaning (reference) except in the context of a proposition (truth).
[11.] See the paper by Rosen in the Bibliography for a full discussion of how someone might claim that the right-hand condition of an instance might imply its corresponding left-hand condition.
[12.] Again, see the work by Wright cited in the Bibliography.
[13.] The reader might find the following observation by Demopoulos useful.
Frege begins his discussion in Gg I, §10 with the observation that, as we might put it, the reference of extension-expressions is fixed only up to arbitrary permutations of the domain of any `model' the system. He then shows how an elaboration of this argument (an elaboration that has come to be known as the permutation argument) establishes that the truth-values (the only primitive logical objects which are not given to us as extensions), can be consistently identified with their own unit classes.[from Demopoulos (forthcoming-a)]The long footnote of §10 shows that the key idea of the section -- the possibility of replacing the truth values with their unit classes -- cannot be extended to the case of every extension which is not given to us as an extension -- as the reference of an extension-expression -- without conflicting with Frege's earlier stipulations (in Gg I, §§3, 9 and 20) regarding extension expressions, i.e., essentially, without conflicting with Basic Law V.