Early Philosophical Interpretations of General Relativity

• 1. The Search for Philosophical Novelty
• 2. Machian Positivism
• 3. Kantian and Neo-Kantian Interpretations
• 4. Logical Empiricism
• 5. "Geometrization of Physics": Realism and Transcendental Idealism
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

1. The Search for Philosophical Novelty

There has been a tendency, not uncommon in the case of a new scientific theory, for every philosopher to interpret the work of Einstein in accordance with his own metaphysical system, and to suggest that the outcome is a great accession of strength to the views which the philosopher in question previously held. This cannot be true in all cases; and it may be hoped that it is true in none. It would be disappointing if so fundamental a change as Einstein has introduced involved no philosophical novelty.

It cannot be denied that general relativity proved a considerable stimulus to "philosophical novelty". But then the question as to whether it particularly supported any one line of philosophical interpretation over another also must take into account the fact that schools of interpretation in turn "evolved" to accommodate what were regarded as its philosophically salient features. A classic instance of this is the assertion, to become a cornerstone of logical empiricism, that relativity theory had shown the untenability of any "philosophy of the synthetic a priori", despite the fact that early works on relativity theory by both Reichenbach and Carnap were written from within that broad perspective. It will be seen that, however ideologically useful, this claim by no means "follows" from relativity theory although, as physicist Max von Laue noted in his early text on general relativity (1921, 42), "not every sentence of The Critique of Pure Reason" might still be held intact. What does "follow" from scrutiny of the various philosophical appropriations of general relativity is rather a consummate illustration that, due to the evolution and mutual interplay of physical, mathematical and philosophical understandings of a revolutionary physical theory, significant "philosophical interpretations" often are works in progress, extending over many years.

2. Machian Positivism

2.1 In the Early Einstein

2.2 A "Relativization of Inertia"?

2.3 Positivism and the "Hole Argument"

However, contemporary scholarship has shown that Einstein's remarks here were but elliptical references to an argument (the so-called "Hole Argument") that has only fully been reconstructed from his private correspondence. Its conclusion is that, if a theory is generally covariant, the points of the spacetime manifold can have no inherent primitive individuality (inherited say, from the underlying topology), and so no reality independent of physical fields (Stachel (1980); Norton (1984), (1993)). Thus for a generally covariant theory, no physical reality accrues to "empty space" (or "spacetime") in the absence of physical fields. This means that the spacetime coordinates are nothing more than arbitrary labels for the identification of physical events, or, with rhetorical embellishment, that space and time have lost "the last remnant of physical objectivity". Hence this passage was not an endorsement of positivist phenomenalism.

2.4 "Mach's Principle"

2.5 An Emerging Anti-Positivism

3. Kantian and Neo-Kantian Interpretations

3.1 Neo-Kantians on Special Relativity

Natorp's treatment, though scarcely six pages is far more detailed (1910, 399-404). In Marburg revisionist fashion, the "Minkowski (sic) principle of relativity" was welcomed as a more consistent (as avoiding "Newtonian absolutism") carrying through of the distinction between transcendentally ideal and purely mathematical concepts of space and time and the relative physical measures of space and time. The relativization of time measurements, in particular, showed that Kant, shorn of the psychologistic error of "pure intuition", had correctly maintained that time is not an object of perception. Natorp further alleged that from this relativization it followed that events are ordered, not in relation to an absolute time, but as lawfully determined phenomena in mutual temporal relation to one another. This is close to a Leibnizian relationism about time. Similarly, the light postulate had a two-fold significance within the Marburg conception of natural science. On the one hand, the uniformity of the velocity of light, deemed an empirical presupposition of all space- and time-measurements, reminded that absolute determinations of these measures, unattainable in empirical natural science, would require a correspondingly absolute bound. Then again, as an upper limiting velocity for physical processes, including gravitational force, the light postulate eliminated the "mysterious absolutism" of Newtonian action-at-a-distance. Natorp regarded the requirement of invariance of laws of nature with respect to the Lorentz transformations as "perhaps the most important result of Minkowski's investigation". However, little is said about this, and in fact there is some confusion regarding these transformations and the Galilean ones they supercede (the former are seen as a "broadening (Erweiterung) of the old supposition of the invariance of Newtonian mechanics for a translatory or circular (zirkuläre, emphasis added) motion of the world coordinates"(403)). He concluded with an observation that the appearance of non-Euclidean and multi-dimensional geometries in physics and mathematics are to be understood only as "valuable tools in the treatment of special problems". In themselves, they furnish no new insight into the (transcendental) logical meaning and ground of the purely mathematically determined concepts of space and time; still less do they require the abandonment of these concepts.

3.2 Immunizing Strategies

3.3 Rejecting or Refurbishing the Transcendental Aesthetic

Winternitz (1924) is an example of this tendency that may be singled out on the grounds that it was deemed significant enough to be the subject of a rare book review by Einstein (1924) . Winternitz argued that the Transcendental Aesthetic is inextricably connected to the claim of the necessarily Euclidean character of physical space and so stood in direct conflict with Einstein's theory. It must accordingly be totally jettisoned as a confusing and unnecessary appendage of the fundamental transcendental project of establishing the a priori logical presuppositions of physical knowledge. Indeed, these presuppositions have been confirmed by the general theory: They are spatiality and temporality as "unintuitive schema of order" in general (as distinct from any particular chronometrical relations), the law of causality and presupposition of continuity, the principle of sufficient reason, and the conservation laws. Remarkably, the necessity of each of these principles was, rightly or wrongly, soon to be challenged by the new quantum mechanics. (For a challenge to the law of conservation of energy, see Bohr, Kramers, and Slater (1924)). According to Winternitz, the ne plus ultra of transcendental idealism lay in the claim that the world "is not given but posed (nicht gegeben, sondern aufgegeben) (as a problem)" out of the given material of sensation. Interestingly, Einstein, late in life, returns to this formulation as comprising the fundamental Kantian insight into the character of physical knowledge (1949b, 680).

However, a number of neo-Kantian positions, of which that of Marburg was only the best known, did not take the core doctrine of the Transcendental Aesthetic, that space and time are a priori intuitions, à la lettre. Rather, resources broadly within it were sought for preserving an updated "critical idealism". In this regard, Bollert (1921) merits mention for its technically adroit presentation of both the special and the general theory. Bollert argued that relativity theory had "clarified" the Kantian position in the Transcendental Aesthetic by demonstrating that not space and time, but spatiality (determinateness in positional ordering) and temporality (in order of succession) are a priori conditions of physical knowledge. In so doing, general relativity theory with its variably curved spacetime, brought a further advance in the steps or levels of "objectivation" lying at the basis of physics. In this process, corresponding with the growth of physical knowledge since Galileo, each higher level is obtained from the previous through elimination of subjective elements from the concept of physical object. This ever-augmented and revised advance of conditions of objectivity is alone central to critical idealism. For this reason, it is "an error" to believe that "a contradiction exists between Kantian a priorism and relativity theory" (1921,64). As will be seen, these conclusions are quite close to those of the much more widely known monograph of Cassirer (1921). It is worth noting that Bollert's interpretation of critical idealism was cited favorably by Gödel (1946/9-B2, 240, n.24) much later during the course of research which led to his famous discovery of rotating universe solutions to Einstein's gravitational field equations (1949). This investigation had been prompted by Gödel's curiosity concerning the similar denials, in relativity theory and in Kant, of an absolute time.

3.4 General Covariance: A Synthetic Principle of "Unity of Determination"

4. Logical Empiricism

4.1 Lessons of Methodology?

But Einstein's theories of relativity provided far more than the subject matter for these philosophical examinations; rather logical empiricist philosophy of science was itself fashioned by lessons allegedly drawn from relativity theory in correcting or rebutting neo-Kantian and Machian perspectives on general methodological and epistemological questions of science. Several of the most characteristic doctrines of logical empiricist philosophy of science — the interpretation of a priori elements in physical theories as conventions, the treatment of the role of conventions in linking theory to observation and in theory choice, the insistence on verificationist definitions of theoretical terms — were taken to have been conclusively demonstrated by Einstein in fashioning his two theories of relativity. In particular, Einstein's 1905 analysis of the conventionality of simultaneity in the special theory of relativity became something of a methodological paradigm, prompting Reichenbach's own method of "logical analysis" of physical theories into "subjective" (definitional, conventional) and "objective" (empirical) components. The overriding concern in the logical empiricist treatment of relativity theory was to draw broad lessons from relativity theory for scientific methodology and philosophy of science generally, although issues more specific to the philosophy of physics were also addressed. Only the former are considered here; for a discussion of the latter, we may refer to Ryckman (forthcoming b).

4.2 From the "Relativized A priori to the "Relativity of Geometry"

However, Reichenbach's first monograph on relativity (1920) was written from within a neo-Kantian perspective. As Friedman (1999) and others have discussed in detail (Ryckman, forthcoming a), Reichenbach's innovation, a modification of the Kantian conception of synthetic a priori principles, rejecting the sense of "valid for all time" while retaining that of "constitutive of the object (of knowledge)", led to the conception of a theory-specific "relativised a priori". According to Reichenbach, any physical theory presupposes the validity of systems of certain, usually quite general, principles, which may vary from theory to theory. Such "coordinating principles", as they are then termed, are indispensable for the ordering of perceptual data; they define "the objects of knowledge" within the theory. The epistemological significance of relativity theory, according to the young Reichenbach, is to have shown, contrary to Kant, that these systems may contain mutually inconsistent principles, and so require emendation to remove contradictions. Thus a "relativization" of the Kantian conception of synthetic a priori principles is the direct epistemological result of the theory of relativity. But this finding is also taken to signal a transformation in the method of epistemological investigation of science. In place of Kant's "analysis of Reason", "the method of analysis of science"(der wissenschaftsanalytische Methode) is proposed as "the only way that affords us an understanding of the contribution of our reason to knowledge" (1920, 71; 1965, 74). The method's raison d'être is to sharply distinguish between the "subjective" role of (coordinating) principles — "the contribution of Reason" — and the "contribution of objective reality", represented by theory-specific empirical laws and regularities ("axioms of connection") which in some sense have been "constituted" by the former. Relativity theory itself is a shining exemplar of this method for it has shown that the metric of spacetime describes an "objective property" of the world, once the subjective freedom to make coordinate transformations (the coordinating principle of general covariance) is recognized (1920, 86-7; 1965, 90). The thesis of metric conventionalism had yet to appear.

But soon it did. Still in 1920, Schlick objected, both publicly and in private correspondence with Reichenbach, that "principles of coordination" were precisely statements of the kind that Poincaré had termed "conventions" (see Coffa, 1991, 201ff.). Moreover, Einstein, in lecture of January, 1921, entitled "Geometry and Experience", appeared to lend support to this view. Einstein argued that the question concerning the nature of spacetime geometry becomes an empirical question only on certain pro tem stipulations regarding the "practically rigid body" of measurement (pro tem in view of the inadmissibility in relativity theory of the concept "actually rigid body"). In any case, by 1922, the essential pieces of Reichenbach's "mature" conventionalist view had emerged. The argument is canonically presented in §8 (entitled "The Relativity of Geometry") of Der Philosophie der Raum-Zeit-Lehre (completed in 1926, published in 1928). In a move superficially similar to the argument of Einstein's "Geometry and Experience", Reichenbach maintained that questions concerning the empirical determination of the metric of spacetime must first confront the fact that only the whole theoretical edifice comprising geometry and physics admits of observational test. Einstein's gravitational theory is such a totality. However, unlike Einstein, Reichenbach's "method of analysis of science", later re-named "logical analysis of science", is directed to the epistemological problem of factoring this totality into its conventional or definitional and its empirical components.

This is done as follows. The empirical determination of the spacetime metric by measurement requires choice of some "metrical indicators": this can only be done by laying down a "coordinative definition" stipulating, e.g., that the metrical notion of a "length" is coordinated to some physical object or process. A standard choice coordinates "lengths" with "infinitesimal measuring rods" supposed rigid (e.g., Einstein's "practically rigid body"). This however is only a convention, and other physical objects or processes might be chosen. (In Schlick's fanciful example, the Dali Lama's heartbeat could be chosen as the physical process establishing units of time.) Of course, the chosen metrical indicators must be corrected for certain distorting effects (temperature, magnetism, etc.) due to the presence of physical forces. Such forces are termed "differential forces" to indicate that they affect various materials differently. However, Reichenbach argued, the choice of a rigid rod as standard of length is tantamount to the claim that there are no non-differential — "universal" — distorting forces that affect all bodies in the same way and cannot be screened off. In the absence of "universal forces" the coordinative definition regarding rigid rods can be implemented and the nature of the spacetime metric empirically determined, for example, finding that paths of light rays through solar gravitational field are not Euclidean straight lines. Thus, the theory of general relativity, on adoption of the coordinative definition of rigid rods ("universal forces = 0"), affirms that the geometry of spacetime in this region is of a non-euclidean kind. The point, however, is that this conclusion rests on the convention governing measuring rods. One could, alternately, maintain that the geometry of spacetime was Euclidean by adopting a different coordinative definition, for example, holding that measuring rods expanded or contracted depending on their position in spacetime, a choice tantamount to the supposition of "universal forces". Then, consistent with all empirical phenomena, it could be maintained that Euclidean geometry was compatible with Einstein's theory if only one allowed the existence of such forces. Thus whether general relativity affirms a Euclidean or a non-euclidean metric in the solar gravitational field rests upon a conventional choice regarding the existence of "universal forces". Either hypothesis may be adopted since they are empirically equivalent descriptions; their joint possibility is referred to as "the relativity of geometry". Just as with the choice of "standard synchrony" in Reichenbach's analysis of the conventionality of simultaneity, also held to be "logically arbitrary", Reichenbach recommends the "descriptively simpler" alternative in which "universal forces" do not exist. To be sure, "descriptive simplicity has nothing to do with truth", i.e., has no bearing on the question of whether spacetime has a non-Euclidean structure (1928, 47; 1958, 35).

4.3 Critique of Reichenbachian Metric Conventionalism

the philosophical theory of relativity, i.e., the discovery of the definitional character of the metric in all its details, holds independently of experience….a philosophical result not subject to the criticism of the individual sciences." (1928, 223; 1958, 177)

Yet this result is neither incontrovertible nor an untrammeled consequence of Einstein's theory of gravitation. There is, first of all, the shadowy status accorded to "universal forces". A sympathetic reading (e.g., Dieks (1987)) suggests that the notion serves usefully in mediating between a traditional a priori commitment to Euclidean geometry and the view of modern geometrodynamics, where gravitational force is "geometrised away" (see §5). For, as Reichenbach explicitly acknowledged, gravitation is itself a "universal force", coupling to all bodies and affecting them in the same manner (1928, 294-6; 1958, 256-8). Hence the choice recommended by "descriptive simplicity" is merely a stipulation that metrical appliances, regarded as "infinitesimal", be considered as "differentially at rest" in an inertial system (1924, 115; 1969, 147). This is a stipulation that spacetime measurements always take place in regions that are to be considered small Minkowski spacetimes (arenas of gravitation-free physics). By the same token, however, consistency required an admission that "the transition from the special theory to the general one represents merely a renunciation of metrical characteristics" (1924, 115; 1969, 147), or, even more pointedly, that "all the metrical properties of the spacetime continuum are destroyed by gravitational fields" where only topological properties remain (1928, 308; 1958, 268-9). To be sure, these conclusions are supposed to be rendered more palatable in connection with the epistemological reduction of spacetime structures in the causal theory of time.

Despite the influence of this argument on the subsequent generation of philosophers of science, Reichenbach's analysis of spacetime measurement treatment is plainly inappropriate, manifesting a fallacious tendency to view the generically curved spacetimes of general relativity as stiched together from little bits of flat Minskowski spacetimes. Besides being mathematically inconsistent, this procedure offers no way of providing a non-metaphorical physical meaning for the fundamental metrical tensor g, the central theoretical concept of general relativity, nor to the series of curvature tensors derivable from it and its associated affine connection. Since these sectional curvatures at a point of spacetime are empirically manifested and the curvature components can be measured, e.g., as the tidal forces of gravity, they can hardly be accounted as due to conventionally adopted "universal forces". Furthermore, the concept of an "infinitesimal rigid rod" in general relativity cannot really be other than the interim stopgap Einstein recognized it to be. For it cannot actually be "rigid" due to these tidal forces; in fact, the concept of a "rigid body" is already forbidden in special relativity as allowing instantaneous causal actions. Secondly, such a rod must indeed be "infinitesimal", i.e., a freely falling body of negligible thickness and of sufficiently short extension, so as to not be stressed by gravitational field inhomogeneities; just how short depending on strength of local curvatures and on measurement error (Torretti (1983), 239). But then, as Reichenbach appeared to have recognized in his comments about the "destruction" of the metric by gravitational fields, it cannot serve as a coordinately defined general standard for metrical relations. In fact, as Weyl was the first to point out, precisely which physical objects or structures are most suitable as measuring instruments should be decided on the basis of gravitational theory itself. From this enlightened perspective, measuring rods and clocks are objects that are far too complicated. Rather, the metric in the region around any observer O can be empirically determined from freely falling ideally small neutral test masses together with the paths of light rays. More precisely stated, the spacetime metric results from the affine-projective structure of the behavior of neutral test particles of negligible mass and from the conformal structure of light rays received and issued by the observer. (Weyl, 1921) Any purely conventional stipulation regarding the behavior of "measuring rods" as physically constitutive of metrical relations in general relativity is then otiose (Weyl, 1923a; Ehlers, Pirani and Schild (1973)). Alas, since Reichenbach reckoned the affine structure of the gravitational-inertial field to be just as conventional as, on his view, its metrical structure, he was not able to recognize this method as other than an equivalent, but by no means necessarily preferable, account of the empirical determination of the metric through the use of rods and clocks (Coffa, 1979; Ryckman (1994), (1996)).

5. "Geometrization of Physics": Realism and Transcendental Idealism

5.1 Differing Motivations

The first phase of the geometrical unification program essentially ended with Einstein's "distant parallelism" theory of 1928-1931 (1929), perhaps Einstein's final public sensation (Fölsing (1997, 605)). Needless to say, none of these efforts met with success. In a lecture at the University of Vienna on October 14, 1931, Einstein forlornly referred to these failed attempts, each conceived on a different differential geometrical basis, as a "graveyard of dead hopes" (Einstein, 1932). By this time, certainly, the prospects for the geometrical unification program had considerably waned. A consensus emerged among nearly all leading theoretical physicists that while the geometrical unification of the gravitation and electromagnetic fields might be attained in formally different ways, the problem of matter, treated with undeniable empirical success by the new quantum theory, was not to be resolved within the confines of spacetime geometry. In any event, from the early 1930s, any unification program appeared greatly premature, in view of the wealth of data produced by the new physics of the nucleus.

As many will know, the unsuccessful pursuit of the goal of geometrical unification absorbed Einstein, and his various research assistants, for more than three decades, up to Einstein's death in 1955. In the course of it, Einstein's methodology of research diametrically changed. In place of physical or heuristic principles to guide theoretical construction, such as the principle of equivalence, which put him on the path to general relativity, he increasingly relied on considerations of mathematical aesthetics, such as "logical simplicity" and the inevitability of certain mathematical structures under variously adopted constraints. In a talk entitled "On the Method of Theoretical Physics" at Oxford in 1933, the transformation was stated dramatically:

Experience remains, of course, the sole criterion of the physical utility of a mathematical construction. But the creative principle resides in mathematics. In a certain sense, therefore, I hold it true that pure thought can grasp reality, as the ancients dreamed. (274)

Moreover, the advent and accumulating empirical successes of the new quantum theory did not dislodge Einstein's core metaphysical belief in a physical reality conceived as a continuous "total field" whose components are functions of the spacetime variables, a geometrical conception of physical reality implied, to be sure, by general relativity (e.g., (1950), 348). Yet, whatever may have been Kaluza's philosophical motivations in putting forward his proposal for geometrical unification, neither Einstein's mathematical realism nor his metaphysics guided either Weyl or Eddington, a fact that has often been obscured or ignored in historical treatments. The geometrical unifications of Weyl (1918a,b) and Eddington (1921) were above all explicit attempts to comprehend the nature of physical theory, in the light of general relativity, from systematic epistemological standpoints that were neither positivist nor realist. As such they comprise "early philosophical interpretations" of that theory, although they intertwine philosophy, geometry and physics in a manner unprecedented since Descartes. Before turning attention to their "interpretations", it will be helpful to see how the geometrizing tendency arises within general relativity itself and to note a few details of the geometrical unification program that followed in its wake.

5.2 "Geometrizing" Gravity: the Initial Step

5.3 Extending "Geometrization"

G = k T,     where G = R 1/2 g R

The expression on the right side, introduced by a coupling constant, mathematically represents the non-gravitational sources of the gravitational field in a region of spacetime in the form of a stress-energy-momentum tensor (an "omnium gatherum" in Eddington's pithy phrase (1919, 63)). As the geometry of spacetime principally resides on the left-hand side, this situation seems unsatisfactory. Late in life, Einstein likened his famous equation to a building, one wing of which (the left) was built of "fine marble", the other (the right) of "low grade wood" (1936, 311). In its classical form, general relativity accords only the gravitational field a direct geometrical significance; the other physical fields reside in spacetime; they are not of spacetime.

Einstein's dissatisfaction with this asymmetrical state of affairs was palpable at an early stage and was expressed with increasing frequency beginning in the early 1920s. A particularly vivid declaration of the need for geometrical unification was made in his "Nobel lecture" of July, 1923:

The mind striving after unification of the theory cannot be satisfied that two fields should exist which, by their nature, are quite independent. A mathematically unified field theory is sought in which the gravitational field and the electromagnetic field are interpreted as only different components or manifestations of the same uniform field,… The gravitational theory, considered in terms of mathematical formalism, i.e. Riemannian geometry, should be generalized so that it includes the laws of the electromagnetic field."(489)

It might be noted that the tacit assumption, evident here, that incorporation of electromagnetism into spacetime geometry requires a generalization of the Riemannian geometry of general relativity, though widely held at the time, is not quite correct (Rainich (1925); Misner and Wheeler (1962); Geroch (1966)).

5.4 A "Pure Infinitesimal Geometry"

(The) distinction between geometry and physics is an error, physics extends not at all beyond geometry: the world is a (3+1) dimensional metrical manifold, and all physical phenomena transpiring in it are only modes of expression of the metric field, …. (M)atter itself is dissolved in "metric" and is not something substantial that in addition exists "in" metric space (1919, 115-16).

By the winter of 1919-1920, for both physical and philosophical reasons (the latter having to do with his conversion to Brouwer's "intuitionist" views about the mathematical continuum, in particular, the continuum of spacetime), Weyl (1920) surrendered the belief, expressed here, that matter, with its corpuscular structure, might be derived within spacetime geometry. Thus he gave up the Holy Grail of the nascent unified field theory program almost before it had begun. Nonetheless, he actively defended his theory well into the 1920s, essentially on the grounds of Husserlian transcendental phenomenology, that his geometry and its central principle, "the epistemological principle of relativity of magnitude" comprised a superior epistemological framework for general relativity. Weyl's postulate of a "pure infinitesimal" non-Riemannian metric for spacetime, according to which it must be possible to independently choose a "gauge" (scale of length or duration) at each spacetime point, met with intense criticism. No observation spoke in favor of it; to the contrary, Einstein pointed out that according to Weyl's theory, the atomic spectra of the chemical elements should not be constant, as indeed they are observed to be. Although Weyl responded to this objection forcefully, and with some subtlety (Weyl, 1923a), he was able to persuade neither Einstein, nor any other leading relativity physicist, with the exception of Eddington. However, the idea of requiring "gauge invariance" of fundamental physical laws was revived and vindicated by Weyl himself in a different form later on (Weyl (1929);see also O'Raifeartaigh (1997)).

5.5 Eddington's "World Geometry"

Eddington was persuaded that Weyl's "principle of relativity of length" was "an essential part of the relativistic conception", a view he retained to the end of his life (e.g., (1939, 28)). But he was also convinced that the largely antagonistic reception accorded Weyl's theory was due to its confusing formulation. The flaw lay in Weyl's failure to make transparently obvious that his locally scale invariant ("pure infinitesimal") "world geometry" was not the physical geometry of actual spacetime, but an entirely mathematical geometry inherently serving to specify the ideal of an observer-independent external world. To remedy this, Eddington devised a general method of deductive presentation of field physics in which "world geometry" is developed mathematically as conceptually separate from physics. A "world geometry" is a purely mathematical geometry the derived objects of which possess only the structural properties requisite to the ideal of a completely impersonal world; these are objects, as he wrote in Space, Time and Gravitation (1920), a semi-popular best-seller, represented "from the point of view of no one in particular". Naturally, this ideal had changed with the progress of physical theory. In the light of relativity theory, such a world is indifferent to specification of reference frame and, after Weyl, of gauge of magnitude (scale). A "world geometry" is not the physical theory of such a world but a framework or "graphical representation" in whose terms existing physical theory might be displayed, essentially by the mathematical identification of known tensors of the existing physical laws of gravitation and electromagnetism, with tensors of the world geometry. Such a geometrical representation of physics cannot really be said to be "right" or "wrong", for it only implements, if it can, current ideas governing the conception of objects and properties of an impersonal objective external world. But when existing physics, in particular, Einstein's theory of gravitation, is set in the context of Eddington's world geometry, it yields a surprising consequence: The Einstein law of gravitation appears as a definition! In the form R = 0 it defines what in the "world geometry" appears to the mind as "vacuum" while in the form of the Einstein field equation noted above, it defines what is there encountered by the mind as "matter". This result is what was meant by his stated claim of throwing "new light on the origin of the fundamental laws of physics". Eddington's notoriously difficult and opaque later works (1936), (1946), took their inspiration from this argumentation in attempting to carry out a similar, but algebraic, program of deriving fundamental physical laws, and the constants occurring in them, from epistemological principles.

5.6 Meyerson on "Pangeometrism"

Though he had "all due respect to the writings of such distinguished scientists" as Weyl and Eddington, Meyerson took their overt affirmations of idealism to be misguided attempts "to associate themselves with a philosophical point of view that is in fact quite foreign to the relativistic doctrine" (§150). That "point of view" is in fact two distinct species of transcendental idealism. It is above all "foreign" to relativity theory because Meyerson cannot see how it is possible to "reintegrate the four-dimensional world of relativity theory into the self". After all, Kant's own argument for Transcendental Idealism proceeded "in a single step", in establishing the subjectivity of the space and time of "our naïve intuition". But this still leaves "the four dimensional universe of relativity independent of the self". Any attempt to "reintegrate" four-dimensional spacetime into the self would have to proceed at a "second stage" where, additionally, there would be no "solid foundation" such as spatial and temporal intuition furnished Kant at the first stage. Perhaps, Meyerson allowed, there is indeed "another intuition, purely mathematical in nature", lying behind spatial and temporal intuition, and capable of "imagining the four-dimensional universe, to which, in turn, it makes reality conform". This would make intuition a "two-stage mechanism". While all of this is not "inconceivable", it does appear, nonetheless, "rather complex and difficult if one reflects upon it". In any case, this is likely to be unnecessary, for considering the matter "with an open mind",

one would seem to be led to the position of those who believe that relativity theory tends to destroy the concept of Kantian intuition (§§ 151-2).

Meyerson had come right up to the threshold of grasping the Weyl-Eddington geometric unification schemes in something like the sense in which they were intended. The stumbling block for him, and for others, is the conviction that transcendental idealism can be supported only from an argument about the nature of intuition, and intuitive representation. To be sure, the geometric framework for Weyl's construction of the objective four-dimensional world of relativity is based upon the Evidenz available in "essential insight", which is limited to the simple linear relations and mappings in what is basically the tangent vector space to a point in a manifold. Thus in Weyl's differential geometry there is a fundamental divide between integrable and non-integrable relations of comparison. The latter are primitive and epistemologically privileged, but nonetheless not justified until it is shown how the infinitesimal homogenous spaces, corresponding to the "essence of space as a form of intution", are compatible with the large-scale inhomogenous spaces (spacetimes) of general relativity. And this required not a philosophical argument about the nature of intution, but one formulated in group-theoretic conceptual form. (Weyl, 1923a,b). Eddington, on the other hand, without the cultural context of Husserlian phenomenology or indeed of philosophy generally, jettisoned the intuitional basis of transcendental idealism altogether, as if unaware of its prominence. Thus he sought a superior and completely general conceptual basis for the objective four-dimensional world of relativity theory by constituting that world within a geometry (its "world structure" (1923)) based upon a non-metrical affine (i.e., linear and symmetric) connection. He was then free to find his own way to the empirically confirmed integrable metric relations of Einstein's theory without being hampered by the conflict of a "pure infinitesimal" metric with the observed facts about rods and clocks.

5.7 "Structural Realism"?

Does the harmony the human intelligence thinks it discovers in nature exist outside of this intelligence? No, beyond doubt, a reality completely independent of the mind which conceives it, sees or feels it, is an impossibility. A world as exterior as that, even if it existed, would for us be forever inaccessible. But what we call objective reality is, in the last analysis, what is common to many thinking beings, and could be common to all; this common part,...,can only be the harmony expressed by mathematical laws. It is this harmony then which is the sole objective reality....

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First published: November 28, 2001
Content last modified: November 28, 2001