Inconsistent Mathematics
Inconsistent mathematics is the study of the mathematical theories that
result when classical mathematical axioms are asserted within the
framework of a (non-classical) logic which can tolerate the presence of
a contradiction without turning every sentence into a theorem.
Inconsistent Mathematics began historically with foundational
considerations. Set-theoretic paradoxes such as Russell's led to
attempts to produce a consistent set theory as a foundation for
mathematics. But, as is well known, set theories such as ZF, NBG and
the like were in various ways ad hoc. Hence, a number of people
including da Costa (1974), Brady (1971), Priest, Routley, and Norman
(1989), considered it preferable to retain the full power of the
natural abstraction principle (every predicate determines a set), and
tolerate a degree of inconsistency in set theory. This requires, of
course, that one dispense with the logical principle ex
contradictione quodlibet (ECQ) (from a contradiction every
proposition may be deduced), as well as any principle which leads to
it, such as disjunctive syllogism (DS) (from A-or-B
and not-A deduce B). But considerable debate, in
Burgess (1981) and Mortensen (1983), made it clear that dispensing with
ECQ and DS was not so counter-intuitive, especially when a plausible
story emerged about the special conditions under which they continue to
hold.
In addition, mathematics has a metalanguage; that is, names for
mathematical statements and other parts of syntax, self-reference,
proof and truth. Gödel's contribution to the philosophy of
mathematics was to show that the first three of these can be rigorously
expressed in arithmetical theories, albeit in theories which are either
inconsistent or incomplete. The possibility of a well-structured
example of the former alternative was not taken seriously, again
because of belief in ECQ. However, in addition natural languages seem
to have their own truth predicate. Combined with self-reference this
produces the Liar paradox, "This sentence is false", an inconsistency.
Priest (1987) and Priest, Routley, and Norman (1989) argued that the
Liar had to be regarded as a statement both true and false, a true
contradiction. This represents another argument for studying
inconsistent theories, namely the claim that some contradictions are
true. Kripke (1975) proposed instead to model a truth predicate
differently, in a consistent incomplete theory. We see below that
incompleteness and inconsistency are closely related.
But mathematics is not its foundations. Hence there is a further
independent motive, to see what mathematical structure remains when the
constraint of consistency is relaxed. But it would be wrong to regard
this as in any way a loss of structure. If it is different at all, then
it represents an addition to known structure.
Robert K. Meyer (1976) seems to have been the first to think of an
inconsistent arithmetical theory. At this point, he was more interested
in the fate of a consistent theory, his relevant arithmetic R#. There
proved to be a whole class of inconsistent arithmetical theories; see
Meyer and Mortensen (1984), for example. Meyer argued that these
theories provide the basis for a revived Hilbert Program.
Hilbert's program was widely held to have been seriously damaged
by Gödel's Second Incompleteness Theorem, according to which
the consistency of arithmetic was unprovable within arithmetic itself.
But a consequence of Meyer's construction was that within his
arithmetic R# it was demonstrable by simple finitary means that
whatever contradictions there might happen to be, they could not
adversely affect any numerical calculations. Hence Hilbert's goal
of conclusively demonstrating that mathematics is trouble-free proves
largely achievable. The arithmetical models used later proved to allow
inconsistent representation of the truth predicate. They also permit
representation of structures beyond natural number arithmetic, such as
rings and fields, including their order properties.
One could hardly ignore the examples of analysis and its special
case, the calculus. There prove to be many places where there are
distinctive inconsistent insights; see Mortensen (1995) for example.
(1) Robinson's non-standard analysis was based on infinitesimals,
quantities smaller than any real number, as well as their reciprocals,
the infinite numbers. This has an inconsistent version, which has some
advantages for calculation in being able to discard higher-order
infinitesimals. Interestingly, the theory of differentiation turned out
to have these advantages, while the theory of integration did not. (2)
Another place is topology, where one readily observes the practice of
cutting and pasting spaces being described as "identification" of one
boundary with another. One can show that this can be described in an
inconsistent theory in which the two boundaries are both identical and
not identical, and it can be further argued that this is the most
natural description of the practice. (3) Yet another application is the
class of inconsistent continuous functions. Not all functions which are
classically discontinuous are amenable of inconsistent treatment; but
some are, for example f(x)=0 for all x<0
and f(x)=1 for all
x
0.
The inconsistent extension replaces the first < by
,
and has distinctive structural properties. These
inconsistent functions may well have some application in dynamic
systems in which there are discontinuous jumps, such as quantum
measurement systems. Differentiating such functions leads to the delta
functions, applied by Dirac to the study of quantum measurement also.
(4) Next, there is the well-known case of inconsistent systems of
linear equations, such as the system (i) x+y=1, plus
(ii) x+y=2. Such systems can potentially arise within
the context of automated control. Little work has been done classically
to solve such systems, but it can be shown that there are well-behaved
solutions within inconsistent vector spaces. (5) Finally, one can note
a further application in topology and dynamics. Given a supposition
which seems to be conceivable, namely that whatever happens or is true,
happens or is true on an open set of (spacetime) points, one has that
the logic of dynamically possible paths is open set logic, that is to
say intuitionist logic, which supports incomplete theories par
excellence. This is because the natural account of the negation of a
proposition in such a space says that it holds on the largest open set
contained in the Boolean complement of the set of points on which the
original proposition held, which is in general smaller than the Boolean
complement. However, specifying a topological space by its closed sets
is every bit as reasonable as specifying it by its open sets. Yet the
logic of closed sets is known to be paraconsistent, ie. supports
inconsistent theories; see Goodman (1981) for example. Thus given the
(alternative) supposition which also seems to be conceivable, namely
that whatever is true is true on a closed set of points, one has that
inconsistent theories may well hold. This is because the natural
account of the negation of a proposition, namely that it holds on the
smallest closed set containing the Boolean negation of the proposition,
means that on the overlapping boundary both the proposition and its
negation hold. Thus dynamical theories determine their own logic of
possible propositions, and corresponding theories which may be
inconsistent, and are certainly as natural as their incomplete
counterparts.
Category theory throws light on many mathematical structures. It has
certainly been proposed as an alternative foundation for mathematics.
Such generality inevitably runs into problems similar to those of
comprehension in set theory, see eg. Hatcher (1982, p.255-260). Hence
there is the same possible application of inconsistent solutions. There
is also an important collection of categorial structures, the toposes,
which support open set logic in exact parallel to the way sets support
Boolean logic. This has been taken by many to be a vindication of the
foundational point of view of mathematical intuitionism. However, it
can be proved that that toposes support closed set logic as readily as
they support open set logic. That should not be viewed as an objection
to intuitionism, however, so much as an argument that inconsistent
theories are equally reasonable as items of mathematical study.
Duality between incompleteness/intuitionism and
inconsistency/paraconsistency has at least two aspects. First there is
the above topological (open/closed) duality. Second there is Routley *
duality. Discovered by the Routleys (1972) as a semantical tool for
relevant logics, the * operation dualises between inconsistent and
incomplete theories of the large natural class of de Morgan logics.
Both kinds of duality interact as well, where the * gives distinctive
duality and invariance theorems for open set and closed set
arithmetical theories. On the basis of these results, it is fair to
argue that both kinds of mathematics, intuitionist and paraconsistent,
are equally reasonable.
A very recent development is the application to explaining the
phenomenon of inconsistent pictures. The best known of these are
perhaps M.C.Escher's masterpieces Belvedere, Waterfall
and Ascending and Descending. In fact the tradition goes back
millennia to Pompeii. Escher seems to have derived many of his
intuitions from the Swedish artist Oscar Reutersvaard, who began in
1934. Escher also actively collaborated with the English mathematician
Roger Penrose. There have been several attempts to describe the
mathematical structure of inconsistent pictures using classical
consistent mathematics, by theorists such as Cowan, Francis and
Penrose. As argued in Mortensen (1997), however, no consistent
mathematical theory can capture the sense that one is seeing an
impossible thing. Only an inconsistent theory can capture the content
of that perception. This amounts to an appeal to cognition, that is the
epistemological justification of paraconsistency as above. One can then
proceed to describe inconsistent theories which are candidates for such
inconsistent contents. There is an analogy with classical mathematics
on this point. Projective geometry is a mathematical theory which is
interesting because we are creatures with an eye, since it explains why
it is that things look the way they do in perspective.
These constructions do not in any way challenge or repudiate
existing mathematics, but extend our conception of what is
mathematically possible.
- Brady, Ross, "The Consistency of the Axioms of Abstraction and
Extensionality in a Three-Valued Logic", Notre Dame Journal of
Formal Logic (NDJFL), 12 (1971), 447-453.
- Burgess, John, "Relevance, a Fallacy?", NDJFL, 22 (1981),
97-104.
- Da Costa, Newton C.A. "On the Theory of Inconsistent Formal
Systems", NDJFL, 15 (1974), 497-510.
- Goodman, Nicholas, "The Logic of Contradictions", Zeitschrift
fur Mathematische Logic und Grundlagen der Arithmetik, 27 (1981),
119-126.
- Hatcher, W.S. The Logical Foundations of Mathematics,
Oxford: Pergamon, 1982.
- Kripke, Saul, "Outline of a Theory of Truth", The Journal of
Philosophy, 72 (1975), 690-716.
- Meyer, Robert K., "Relevant Arithmetic", Bulletin of the
Section of Logic of the Polish Academy of Sciences, 5 (1976),
133-137.
- Meyer, Robert K. and Chris Mortensen, "Inconsistent Models for
Relevant Arithmetics",The Journal of Symbolic Logic, 49
(1984), 917-929.
- Mortensen, Chris, "Reply to Burgess and to Read", NDJFL,
24 (1983), 35-40.
- Mortensen, Chris, Inconsistent Mathematics, Kluwer
Mathematics and Its Applications Series, Kluwer, 1995.
Errata
- Mortensen, Chris, "Peeking at the Impossible", NDJFL, 38
(1997), 527-534.
- Priest, Graham, In Contradiction, Dordrecht: Nijhoff,
1987.
- Priest, Graham, Richard Routley and Jean Norman (eds),
Paraconsistent Logic, Munchen: Philosophia Verlag, 1989.
- Routley, Richard and Val, "The Semantics of First Degree
Entailment", Nous, 6 (1972), 335-359.
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
contradiction |
logic: paraconsistent |
mathematics, philosophy of
Copyright © 1996, 2000 by
Chris Mortensen
Chris.Mortensen@adelaide.edu.au
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First published: July 2, 1996
Content last modified: August 7, 2000