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The doctrines of heaven and hell are doctrines concerning the afterlife. Recent theological work that denies existence beyond the grave (e.g., MacQuarrie) has sometimes included metaphorical reference to heaven and hell as aspects of one's present earthly life, wanting to retain the deep personal significance of our choices involved in talk of heaven and hell without endorsing the substantive metaphysical thesis of life after death. Though there may be a point to such metaphors, the doctrines of heaven and hell involve a commitment to the idea of an afterlife and to an eschatological significance of our present lives beyond the grave.
The doctrines of heaven and hell play an important social function as well. Even atheists have often held that the doctrines ought to be taught, even if false, because of the motivation they provide for good behavior. Here, however, the focus will be on the purely cognitive issues involved in the doctrines: whether they are true or false, and the kinds of arguments used to defend a view on the matter.
(1) The Punishment Thesis: the purpose of hell is to punish those whose earthly lives and behavior warrant it. (2) The No Escape Thesis: it is metaphysically impossible to get out of hell once one has been consigned there. (3) The Anti-Universalism Thesis: some people will be consigned to hell. (4) The Eternal Existence Thesis: hell is a place of unending conscious existence.
We can call this particular elaboration of the punishment model “the traditional doctrine of hell,” and it, or a minor modification of it, is the primary doctrine of hell found throughout the history of Christianity. The minor modification arises from the doctrine known as the harrowing of hell, according to which between the time of Jesus' death and resurrection, he preached to the inhabitants of hell, some of whom accepted his message and thereby went to heaven. The doctrine of the harrowing of hell thus implies the falsity of the No Escape Thesis, since according to that doctrine, some have escaped hell. The modification of the traditional view is only minor, however, since the escape in question results from a unique and unrepeatable event, so that it is not possible for anyone apart from this special event to escape from hell. This modified No Escape Thesis yields a minor modification of the Traditional Doctrine, but one with little philosophical significance for the question of the justice or fairness of hell, since there is no distinction whatsoever between the modified view and the traditional view once the central events of Jesus's death and resurrection have been completed, and the questions surrounding the justice or fairness of hell do not involve any special considerations of the location in history of those who end up in hell.
This characterization of the traditional view of hell leaves open whether hell involves the same punishment for all in hell, or whether there are differences in the degree of punishment. The strong version of the traditional view maintains that the punishment is the same for all, and a mitigation of this strong view argues that the traditional view is correct but needs to be supplemented by a clause specifying how some people deserve harsher treatment in hell than others.
The standard argument for the traditional view of hell appeals to a principle concerning when punishment is justified, and this argument claims that punishment deserved is not simply a function of harm caused and harm intended, even though such considerations take center stage in usual non-teleological theories of punishment. The traditional view of hell cannot be sustained by appeal to a theory of punishment of this sort, for it would be at best contingent that hell is the appropriate punishment on such a theory. To defend the traditional view of hell, something stronger is needed. According to defenders of the traditional view, punishment deserved is also a function of the status of the individual one has wronged, and they argue that all wrongdoing constitutes a wrong against God, and that wronging God is as bad a thing as anyone could do — they are infinitely bad thereby justifying an infinite punishment.
This argument would seem to be vulnerable at the point where it requires that all wrongdoing involves wronging God. Critics of the argument wonder how this could be. People generally do not intend to harm God or to defy him in some way when they act wrongly, though of course both are possible. Defenders of the argument appeal to the ideas of ownership and dependence in response to these charges. One can wrong the Rockefellers, for example, by destroying their property, whether or not one is aware of whose property is being destroyed. Moreover, one can wrong parents by harming their children, whether or not one has any acquaintance with the parents (and even if, by some bizarre metaphysical reasoning, one has become convinced either that the particular child in question is parentless or that no one has any parents).
Attention to the parent/child analogy is particularly instructive, for there comes a point in time at which parents are no longer wronged by harms done to their offspring, though they presumably will still be angered and offended by such actions. There is no precise cutoff point at which the parents are no longer wronged, but the moral difference here clearly has to do with the degree of independence from the parents that has been achieved. Middle-aged and fully competent adults normally have achieved such independence, whereas infants clearly have not.
Regardless of the vagueness of the concept of the dependence relation between parent and child, the relation itself is useful in a defense of the idea that all wrongdoing wrongs God. If one endorses the doctrine of divine conservation, according to which God sustains the universe at every moment of existence, one has grounds for thinking of the relationship between God and created things in a way that supports the idea than all wrongdoing wrongs God. For created things are even more dependent on God that the smallest infants on their parents, so if degree of independence is the right way to think about the conditions under which wronging offspring fails to wrong parents, no such degree of independence is possible between God and his creation.
The defensibility of the claim that all wrongdoing wrongs God has been taken to be the linchpin for a successful defense of the traditional doctrine of hell, but that claim is false. Even if all wrongdoing wrongs God and is therefore, in an objective sense, infinitely bad, it does not follow that an infinite punishment is deserved. A little attention to homicides and ways in which one can cause the death of another human being shows the inadequacy of such an inference. Causing the death of a human being is a very serious matter — in an objective sense, we may assume that it is among the worst things a person could do. Even so, punishment deserved is not simply a function of the badness of the action. The killing might have been accidental, for example, or it might have been done for the sake of justice, as in cases of capital punishment or in carrying out a just war. These examples show that even if an action rates very high on the scale of badness, other factors can diminish the severity of punishment deserved and, in some cases, eliminate it altogether. Included among these other factors are the intentions, plans, and goals of the person in question, and depending on what we find here, it is possible for a truly bad action to warrant no punishment at all—as often happens when people lose their lives in car accidents. The proper perspective, then, is to view the traditional view as being undermined if no defense can be offered for the claim that all wrongdoing wrongs God, but that a full defense of the traditional view requires more than this claim.
In each case, the perceived need for an alternative to the traditional view concerns the injustice or unfairness of hell on the traditional construal of it. The same concern can prompt a different kind of alteration of the traditional view, one that denies that heaven and hell are exclusive and exhaustive of afterlife possibilities. For example, the need for a doctrine of limbo, the place of abode for unbaptized but innocent or righteous individuals, addressing the issue of the eternal destiny of children short of the age of accountability or those who have never heard the Christian message, is best viewed as arising from some perceived injustice involved in the Traditional Doctrine. The doctrine of purgatory, the state in which those who have died in grace expiate their sins, might be viewed in this way as well, though it is also possible to view purgatory as a part of heaven, albeit not as blessed as other parts.
Universalism has an advantage over Annihilationism in this respect, for it contains no features that appear to raise greater concern about the justice of hell than the traditional view. The fundamental issue for it is that its most promising variety fails to solve the problem of the perceived injustice of hell. Universalism can be offered as a contingent thesis or as a necessary one. If it is offered as a necessary thesis, the thesis that it is metaphysically impossible for anyone to end up in hell, it faces difficulty in explaining how human freedom is involved in any substantive way in determining one's eternal destiny. For no matter what one's choices or attitudes, no matter what one wishes or desires, one will end up in heaven on this view. Given this implication of necessary Universalism, the most common form of the view is a contingent one, according to which, even though it is metaphysically possible that some end up in hell, as a matter of fact no one will. The problem for this version of Universalism, however, is that it fails to solve the problem it was intended to solve. For the traditional understanding of God does not portray him as good as a matter of happenstance, but rather as an essential feature of him. So if it is a merely contingent fact that all are saved and thus avoid hell, this universalist position still allows that it is possible for some to end up in hell, but if the traditional doctrine of hell threatens to undermine God's goodness because some actually end up in hell, contingent Universalism equally threatens to undermine God's goodness because some might end up in hell. Contingent Universalism thus only modally masks the underlying problem of the perceived injustice of hell.
Second chance views fare no better. Some views that go by that name are not alterations of the Traditional Doctrine of Hell at all, but merely insist that because of the severity of hell, persons deserve a second chance to avoid it after death (notice that nothing in the above four theses requires that presence in heaven or hell occurs immediately after one dies). Yet, if such a second chance is deserved, it is hard to see why the same considerations would not justify a third chance if the second chance were passed on, thereby launching an infinite sequence of delays of consignment to hell. The regress cannot be endorsed, since being in that condition would itself constitute residence in hell, with the possibility of escape (since it would be a condition of eternal separation from God, barring escape). So second chance views that try to allow second chances prior to consignment to hell must explain how the regress is avoided.
Other second chance views claim that consignment to hell cannot be postponed, but that escape from it is not impossible; all that is needed to get out is the same change of heart, mind, and will required in one's earthly life to be fit for heaven. One difficulty for such a view is theological rather than philosophical, for such views fail to be truly eschatological accounts of heaven and hell. Eschatology is the doctrine of the last things, and one feature of this idea of culmination or consummation is that there is a finality to it. In Christian thought, this idea is expressed vividly in the idea of a final judgment, and any conception of the afterlife that treats residence in heaven and hell in the geographic way in which we think of residence in, say, Texas or California, simply does not fall into the category of an eschatological doctrine at all (see Hebblewaite). If heaven and hell are conceived of as mere extensions of an earthly life, where people can pack up and move at will, such a conception has more affinity to religious perspectives that espouse endless cycles of rebirth than to religions including an eschatological dimension.
This theological issue raises an important point, for a tension exists in the doctrines of heaven and hell between regarding how much continuity is to be expected between this earthly life and the afterlife. One example is the eschatological issue above concerning the loss of the idea of the notion of finality in the afterlife. Another example is hinted at above, concerning geographic assumptions about where one might reside (see Kvanvig). These latter ideas, together with perceived difficulties with the traditional view, lead to the doctrine of limbo. The greater a view is inclined to model the afterlife on our present earthly experience, the greater will be the temptation toward geographic conceptions of the afterlife and quasi-reincarnational views. The alternative is to view heaven and hell as the exclusive and exhaustive eschatological options, because to be in heaven is to be with God and to be in hell is to fail to be with God. The fundamental philosophical issue here is similar to the issue of how much anthropomorphizing is allowable in one's theology. Regarding both the issue of the nature of God and the nature of the afterlife, the question is how much of our present experience is allowably introduced when addressing these issues, and at what point an account involves the unwarranted extension of our present experience to theological topics radically different from that experience.
In all these ways, typical alternatives to the traditional view fail to deal with the fundamental problem of the traditional view, and face enormous difficulties because of it. The fundamental problem for the traditional conception of hell is that people receive an infinite punishment for less than infinite sin. One standard reply to such a complaint is that it matters not only what the character of your sin is, but also who the sin is against in determining appropriate punishment. Such a response, however, presumes some way of ranking individuals so that sinning against beings higher on the scale is more wrong than sinning against beings lower on the scale. Furthermore, this ranking will have to yield the result that sinning against God deserves infinite punishment whereas no other sin does. This position is difficult to maintain. Even if it is granted that sin against God is infinitely bad, punishment deserved is not directly correlated with the seriousness of wrong done. Causing the death of a person is the worst thing one can do to a human being, but some ways of doing something so seriously bad do not deserve any punishment at all (accidental killings, for example, or perhaps killing in a just war). Punishment deserved must be a function both of seriousness of wrong done, and some information about the intentions of the person doing the wrong. Furthermore, the latter information can sometimes yield the result that little or no punishment is deserved at all, even though the action performed seriously wrongs someone.
Many of the same alternatives arise for the Choice model as arise for the Punishment model. One already noted is the issue of whether hell is conceived in terms of annihilation or in terms of eternal existence apart from God. Another issue is whether the Choice model is committed to something like a second chance alternative. At first glance it seems that it would amount to a second chance view, insofar as one's capacity to choose differently from what one had chosen in the past remains. One way to argue that the Choice model involves no commitment to a second chance view is to argue that there is no chance of escaping hell even on the Choice model if the choice needs to be rational and the most persuasive rational considerations that would prompt such a choice have already been exhausted. In a similar fashion, nothing about the Choice model itself argues against universalism, though the fundamental importance of freedom on this model might provide a basis for arguing against the idea that it is metaphysically impossible to avoid heaven.
At its core, this concern about whether it is possible to leave heaven or escape hell is a threat to the idea of finality or culmination involved in traditional eschatology. The concerns raised from this quarter show how difficult it is to conceive of the afterlife as both a continuation of personal existence, including those aspects of being a person that seem so central, such as freedom and autonomy, and yet as a culmination involving finality. One can retain aspects of freedom and autonomy for personal existence when one argues that no one will ever leave heaven or escape hell, that no one would do so, or even that any such choice would be completely unmotivated and hence inexplicable. The stronger claim that it is metaphysically impossible to leave heaven or escape hell presents greater challenges, however, for such a position is harder to reconcile with the presence of freedom and autonomy so central to our conception of survival of death as persons; and yet, such metaphysical impossibility is the most natural position to endorse when one's conception of the afterlife is a truly eschatological perspective involving the ideas of finality and culmination.
The second aspect of the history of Christian reflection about heaven that signals a concern for the justice or fairness of it is the doctrine of purgatory and the correlative partitioning of heaven so that differential rewards are given to different individuals. The doctrine of purgatory holds a special place in this regard, however, for it is one thing to think that some individuals deserve a greater reward than others, and it is quite another thing to think that some individuals must undergo the inconvenience of purgatory in compensation for failures of the past or for the purpose of character development in preparation for the more blessed experience of (other regions of) heaven. Whereas the point of the doctrine of justification is to relieve Christianity of the charge that its understanding of heaven threatens the righteousness of God, the point of the doctrine of purgatory can be taken to rebut the claim that God's bestows his grace in a profligate manner. There is both the sense of unfairness involved in granting the same heavenly experience to those redeemed only at the last moment “between the saddle and the soil” and those whose youthful redemption is followed by lifelong service and faithfulness to God, and a sense of incoherence in maintaining that true blessedness can be experienced by those whose lives and character are still bent and twisted by sin. True blessedness comes only when one's desires for the good are satisfied, and for those who desire otherwise, such is simply impossible.
More can be said, however. In the Christian view, God's fundamental motive must be conceived of in terms of love rather than justice. Justice has no hope of explaining the two great acts of God, creation and redemption; only love can account for them. If so, however, one's account of hell ought to accord with this hierarchical conception of God's motivational structure as well. In particular, it will not do to portray God as fundamentally loving until we reach the point of discussing the nature of hell, and suddenly portray God as fundamentally a just God--God simply couldn't be fundamentally both without engendering paralysis in cases where the two conflict. In some way, the tnesion must be addressed and resolved.
The most straightforward way to give a unified account of heaven and hell is to portray each as flowing from one and the same divine motivational structure. Whereas the Punishment Model of Hell has difficulty proceeding in this way, the Choice Model seems much better suited to such an account. For if hell is constructed to honor the choices that free individual might make, it is not hard to see how a fundamentally loving God could construct it in this way. For in truly loving another, we often must risk losing the other, and part of loving completely requires a willingness to lose the other completely as well. Such a unified conception of heaven and hell, where both are grounded in and explained in terms of God's love, comports well with Dante's conception of hell: hell was built by divine power, by the highest wisdom, and by primordial love.
Adopting a unified account of heaven and hell does not by itself yield a complete view of heaven and hell, even when the unified account portrays both heaven and hell as issuing from the Divine motive of love. Even if one denies the punishment thesis of the traditional view, there is still the question of the other three theses. Depending on which theses are accepted, the choice model can be developed so as to involve a kind of annihilationism, or universalism, as well as the choice view closest to the traditional view of hell, the choice view that endorses all of the theses of the traditional view except the punishment thesis.
Still, many of the same difficulties arise for these views in the context of the choice model as arose in the context of the punishment model. Annihilationism would be hard to portray as a mitigation of the harshness of hell, since hell is no longer being conceived primarily in terms of punishment (though nothing about the choice model requires denying that hell involves punishment motivated by love). Universalism in its necessary form still will be difficult to reconcile with notions of freedom and autonomy, and contingent universalism will need a defense that doesn't advert to the unloving character of hell and the jarring thought of how a loving God could allow someone to suffer the ultimate disaster of hell as conceived in the traditional view of hell. Moreover any version of the choice model will need either to jettison the eschatological ideas of finality and consummation or offer some explanation of how these ideas can be affirmed in the absence of the kind of finality that rests ultimately on a divine decree.
| Jonathan Kvanvig kvanvigj@missouri.edu |
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