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Aristotle's Logic
Aristotle's logic, especially his theory of the syllogism, has had an
unparalleled influence on the history of Western thought. It did not
always hold this position: in the Hellenistic period, Stoic logic, and
in particular the work of Chrysippus, was much more celebrated.
However, in later antiquity, following the work of Aristotelian
Commentators, Aristotle's logic became dominant, and Aristotelian logic
was what was transmitted to the Arabic and the Latin medieval
traditions, while the works of Chrysippus have not survived.
This unique historical position has not always contributed to the
understanding of Aristotle's logical works. Kant thought that Aristotle
had discovered everything there was to know about logic, and the
historian of logic Prantl drew the corollary that any logician after
Aristotle who said anything new was confused, stupid, or perverse.
During the rise of modern formal logic following Frege and Peirce,
adherents of Traditional Logic (seen as the descendant of Aristotelian
Logic) and the new mathematical logic tended to see one another as
rivals, with incompatible notions of logic. More recent scholarship has
often applied the very techniques of mathematical logic to Aristotle's
theories, revealing (in the opinion of many) a number of similarities
of approach and interest between Aristotle and modern logicians.
This article is written from the latter perspective. As such, it is
about Aristotle's logic, which is not always the same thing as what has
been called "Aristotelian" logic.
[A More Detailed Table of Contents]
Aristotle's logical works contain the earliest formal study of logic
that we have. It is therefore all the more remarkable that together
they comprise a highly developed logical theory, one that was able to
command immense respect for many centuries: Kant, who was ten times
more distant from Aristotle than we are from him, even held that
nothing significant had been added to Aristotle's views in the
intervening two millennia.
In the last century, Aristotle's reputation as a logician has
undergone two remarkable reversals. The rise of modern formal logic
following the work of Frege and Russell brought with it a recognition
of the many serious limitations of Aristotle's logic; today, very few
would try to maintain that it is adequate as a basis for understanding
science, mathematics, or even everyday reasoning. At the same time,
scholars trained in modern formal techniques have come to view
Aristotle with new respect, not so much for the correctness of his
results as for the remarkable similarity in spirit between much of his
work and modern logic. As Jonathan Lear has put it, "Aristotle shares
with modern logicians a fundamental interest in metatheory": his
primary goal is not to offer a practical guide to argumentation but to
study the properties of inferential systems themselves.
The ancient commentators grouped together several of Aristotle's
treatises under the title Organon ("Instrument") and regarded
them as comprising his logical works:
- Categories
- On Interpretation
- Prior Analytics
- Posterior Analytics
- Topics
- On Sophistical Refutations
In fact, the title Organon reflects a much later controversy
about whether logic is a part of philosophy (as the Stoics maintained)
or merely a tool used by philosophy (as the later Peripatetics
thought); calling the logical works "The Instrument" is a way of taking
sides on this point. Aristotle himself never uses this term, nor does
he give much indication that these particular treatises form some kind
of group, though there are frequent cross-references between the
Topics and the Analytics. On the other hand,
Aristotle treats the Prior and Posterior Analytics as
one work, and On Sophistical Refutations is a final section,
or an appendix, to the Topics). To these works should be added
the Rhetoric, which explicitly declares its reliance on the
Topics.
All Aristotle's logic revolves around one notion: the
deduction (sullogismos). A thorough
explanation of what a deduction is, and what they are composed of, will
necessarily lead us through the whole of his theory. What, then, is a
deduction? Aristotle says:
A deduction is speech (logos) in which, certain
things having been supposed, something different from those supposed
results of necessity because of their being so. (Prior
Analytics I.2, 24b18-20)
Each of the "things supposed" is a premise
(protasis) of the argument, and what "results of necessity" is
the conclusion (sumperasma).
The core of this definition is the notion of "resulting of
necessity" (ex anankês sumbainein). This corresponds to
a modern notion of logical consequence: X results of necessity from Y
and Z if it would be impossible for X to be false when Y and Z are
true. We could therefore take this to be a general definition of "valid
argument".
Deductions are one of two species of argument recognized by Aristotle.
The other species is induction
(epagôgê). He has far less to say about this than
deduction, doing little more than characterize it as "argument from the
particular to the universal". However, induction (or something very
much like it) plays a crucial role in the theory of scientific
knowledge in the Posterior Analytics: it is induction, or at
any rate a cognitive process that moves from particulars to their
generalizations, that is the basis of knowledge of the indemonstrable
first principles of sciences.
Despite its wide generality, Aristotle's definition of deduction is not
a precise match for a modern definition of validity. Some of the
differences may have important consequences:
- Aristotle explicitly says that what results of necessity must be
different from what is supposed. This would rule out arguments in which
the conclusion is identical to one of the premises. Modern notions of
validity regard such arguments as valid, though trivially so.
- The plural "certain things having been supposed" was taken by some
ancient commentators to rule out arguments with only one premise.
- The force of the qualification "because of their being so" has
sometimes been seen as ruling out arguments in which the conclusion is
not ‘relevant’ to the premises, e.g., arguments in which
the premises are inconsistent, arguments with conclusions that would
follow from any premises whatsoever, or arguments with superfluous
premises.
Of these three possible restrictions, the most interesting would be the
third. This could be (and has been) interpreted as committing Aristotle
to something like a
relevance logic.
In fact, there are passages that appear to confirm this. However, this
is too complex a matter to discuss here.
However the definition is interpreted, it is clear that Aristotle
does not mean to restrict it only to a subset of the valid arguments.
This is why I have translated sullogismos with
‘deduction’ rather than its English cognate. In modern
usage, ‘syllogism’ means an argument of a very specific
form. Moreover, modern usage distinguishes between valid syllogisms
(the conclusions of which follow from their premises) and invalid
syllogisms (the conclusions of which do not follow from their
premises). The second of these is inconsistent with Aristotle's use:
since he defines a sullogismos as an argument in which the
conclusion results of necessity from the premises, "invalid
sullogismos" is a contradiction in terms. The first is also at
least highly misleading, since Aristotle does not appear to think that
the sullogismoi are simply an interesting subset of the valid
arguments. Moreover (see below), Aristotle expends great efforts to
argue that every valid argument, in a broad sense, can be "reduced" to
an argument, or series of arguments, in something like one of the forms
traditionally called a syllogism. If we translate sullogismos
as "syllogism, ", this becomes the trivial claim "Every syllogism is a
syllogism",
Syllogisms are structures of sentences each of which can meaningfully
be called true or false: assertions
(apophanseis), in Aristotle's terminology. According to
Aristotle, every such sentence must have the same structure: it must
contain a subject (hupokeimenon) and a
predicate and must either affirm or deny the predicate
of the subject. Thus, every assertion is either the
affirmation kataphasis or the
denial (apophasis) of a single predicate of a
single subject.
In On Interpretation, Aristotle argues that a single
assertion must always either affirm or deny a single predicate of a
single subject. Thus, he does not recognize sentential compounds, such
as conjunctions and disjunctions, as single assertions. This appears to
be a deliberate choice on his part: he argues, for instance, that a
conjunction is simply a collection of assertions, with no more
intrinsic unity than the sequence of sentences in a lengthy account
(e.g. the entire Iliad, to take Aristotle's own example).
Since he also treats denials as one of the two basic species of
assertion, he does not view negations as sentential compounds. His
treatment of conditional sentences and disjunctions is more difficult
to appraise, but it is at any rate clear that Aristotle made no efforts
to develop a sentential logic. Some of the consequences of this for his
theory of demonstration are important.
Subjects and predicates of assertions are terms. A
term (horos) can be either individual, e.g. Socrates,
Plato or universal, e.g. human, horse,
animal, white. Subjects may be either individual or
universal, but predicates can only be universals: Socrates is
human, Plato is not a horse, horses are animals,
humans are not horses.
The word universal (katholou) appears to
be an Aristotelian coinage. Literally, it means "of a whole"; its
opposite is therefore "of a particular" (kath’
hekaston). Universal terms are those which can properly serve as
predicates, while particular terms are those which cannot.
This distinction is not simply a matter of grammatical function. We
can readily enough construct a sentence with "Socrates" as its
grammatical predicate: "The person sitting down is Socrates".
Aristotle, however, does not consider this a genuine predication. He
calls it instead a merely accidental or
incidental (kata sumbebêkos)
predication. Such sentences are, for him, dependent for their truth
values on other genuine predications (in this case, "Socrates is
sitting down").
Consequently, predication for Aristotle is as much a matter of
metaphysics as a matter of grammar. The reason that the term
Socrates is an individual term and not a universal is that the
entity which it designates is an individual, not a universal. What
makes white and human universal terms is that they
designate universals.
Further discussion of these issues can be found in the entry on
Aristotle's metaphysics.
Aristotle takes some pains in On Interpretation to argue that
to every affirmation there corresponds exactly one denial such that
that denial denies exactly what that affirmation affirms. The pair
consisting of an affirmation and its corresponding denial is a
contradiction (antiphasis). In general,
Aristotle holds, exactly one member of any contradiction is true and
one false: they cannot both be true, and they cannot both be false.
However, he appears to make an exception for propositions about future
events, though interpreters have debated extensively what this
exception might be (see
further discussion
below). The principle that contradictories cannot both be true has
fundamental importance in Aristotle's metaphysics (see
further discussion
below).
One major difference between Aristotle's understanding of predication
and modern (i.e., post-Fregean) logic is that Aristotle treats
individual predications and general predications as similar in logical
form: he gives the same analysis to "Socrates is an animal" and "Humans
are animals". However, he notes that when the subject is a universal,
predication takes on two forms: it can be either
universal or particular. These
expressions are parallel to those with which Aristotle distinguishes
universal and particular terms, and Aristotle is aware of that,
explicitly distinguishing between a term being a universal and a term
being universally predicated of another.
Whatever is affirmed or denied of a universal subject may be
affirmed or denied of it it universally
(katholou or "of all", kata pantos), in
part (kata meros, en merei), or
indefinitely (adihoristos).
|
Affirmations |
Denials |
| Universal |
P affirmed of all of S |
Every S is P,
All S is (are) P |
P denied of all of S |
No S is P |
| Particular |
P affirmed of some of S |
Some S is (are) P |
P denied of some of S |
Some S is not P,
Not every S is P |
| Indefinite |
P affirmed of S |
S is P |
P denied of S |
S is not P |
In On Interpretation, Aristotle spells out the relationships
of contradiction for sentences with universal subjects as follows:
|
Affirmation |
Denial |
| Universal |
Every A is B |
No A is B |
| Universal |
Some A is B |
Not every A is B |
Simple as it appears, this table raises important difficulties of
interpretation (for a thorough discussion, see the entry on the
square of opposition).
In the Prior Analytics, Aristotle adopts a somewhat
artificial way of expressing predications: instead of saying "X is
predicated of Y" he says "X belongs (huparchei) to Y". This
should really be regarded as a technical expression. The verb
huparchein usually means either "begin" or "exist, be
present", and Aristotle's usage appears to be a development of this
latter use.
For clarity and brevity, I will use the following semi-traditional
abbreviations for Aristotelian categorical sentences (note that the
predicate term comes first and the subject term
second):
| Abbreviation |
Sentence |
| Aab |
a belongs to all b (Every b is a) |
| Eab |
a belongs to no b (No b is a) |
| Iab |
a belongs to some b (Some b is a) |
| Oab |
a does not belong to all b (Some b is not a) |
Aristotle's most famous achievement as logician is his theory of
inference, traditionally called the syllogistic
(though not by Aristotle). That theory is in fact the theory of
inferences of a very specific sort: inferences with two premises, each
of which is a categorical sentence, having exactly one term in common,
and having as conclusion a categorical sentence the terms of which are
just those two terms not shared by the premises. Aristotle calls the
term shared by the premises the middle term
(meson) and each of the other two terms in the premises an
extreme (akron). The middle term must be
either subject or predicate of each premise, and this can occur in
three ways: the middle term can be the subject of one premise and the
predicate of the other, the predicate of both premises, or the subject
of both premises. Aristotle refers to these term arrangements as
figures (schêmata):
|
First Figure |
Second Figure |
Third Figure |
|
Predicate |
Subject |
Predicate |
Subject |
Predicate |
Subject |
| Premise |
a |
b |
a |
b |
a |
c |
| Premise |
b |
c |
a |
c |
b |
c |
| Conclusion |
a |
c |
b |
c |
a |
b |
Aristotle calls the term which is the predicate of the conclusion the
major term and the term which is the subject of the
conclusion the minor term. The premise containing the
major term is the major premise, and the premise
containing the minor term is the minor premise.
Aristotle's procedure is then a systematic investigation of the
possible combinations of premises in each of the three figures. For
each combination, he seeks either to demonstrate that some conclusion
necessarily follows or to demonstrate that no conclusion follows. The
results he states are exactly correct.
Aristotle shows each valid form to be valid by showing how to construct
a deduction of its conclusion from its premises. These deductions, in
turn, can take one of two forms: direct or
probative (deiktikos) deductions and
deductions through the impossible (dia to
adunaton).
A direct deduction is a series of steps leading from the premises to
the conclusion, each of which is either a conversion
of a previous step or an inference from two previous steps relying on a
first-figure deduction. Conversion, in turn, is inferring from a
proposition another which has the subject and predicate interchanged.
Specifically, Aristotle argues that three such conversions are
sound:
- Eab → Eba
- Iab → Iba
- Aab → Iba
He undertakes to justify these in An. Pr. I.2. From a
modern standpoint, the third is sometimes regarded with suspicion.
Using it we can get Some monsters are chimeras from the
apparently true All chimeras are monsters; but the former is
often construed as implying in turn There is something which is a
monster and a chimera, and thus that there are monsters and there
are chimeras. In fact, this simply points up something about
Aristotle's system: Aristotle in effect supposes that all
terms in syllogisms are non-empty. (For further discussion of this
point, see the entry on the
square of opposition).
As an example of the procedure, we may take Aristotle's proof of
Camestres. He says:
If M belongs to every N but to no X, then neither will N
belong to any X. For if M belongs to no X, then neither does X belong
to any M; but M belonged to every N; therefore, X will belong to no M
(for the first figure has come about). And since the privative
converts, neither will N belong to any X. (An. Pr. I.5,
27a9-12)
From this text, we can extract an exact formal proof, as
follows:
| Step |
Justification |
Aristotle's Text |
| 1. MaN |
|
If M belongs to every N |
| 2. MeX |
|
but to no X, |
| To prove: NeX |
|
then neither will N belong to any X. |
| 3. MeX |
(2, premise) |
For if M belongs to no X, |
| 4. XeM |
(3, conversion of e) |
then neither does X belong to any M; |
| 5. MaN |
(1, premise) |
but M belonged to every N; |
| 6. XeN |
(4, 5, Celarent) |
therefore, N will belong to no M (for the first figure has come
about). |
| 7. NeX |
(6, conversion of e) |
And since the privative converts, neither will N belong to any
X. |
Aristotle proves invalidity by constructing counterexamples. This is
very much in the spirit of modern logical theory: all that it takes to
show that a certain form is invalid is a single
instance of that form with true premises and a false
conclusion. However, Aristotle states his results not by saying that
certain premise-conclusion combinations are invalid but by saying that
certain premise pairs do not "syllogize": that is, that, given the pair
in question, examples can be constructed in which premises of that form
are true and a conclusion of any of the four possible forms is false.
When possible, he does this by a clever and economical method: he
gives two triplets of terms, one of which makes the premises true and a
universal affirmative "conclusion" true, and the other of which makes
the premises true and a universal negative "conclusion" true. The first
is a counterexample for an argument with either an E or an O
conclusion, and the second is a counterexample for an argument with
either an A or an I conclusion.
In Prior Analytics I.4-6, Aristotle shows that the premise
combinations given in the following table yield deductions and that all
other premise combinations fail to yield a deduction. in the
terminology traditional since the middle ages, each of these
combinations is known as a mood (from Latin
modus, "way", which in turn is a translation of Greek
tropos). Aristotle, however, does not use this expression and
instead refers to "the arguments in the figures".
In this table,
"
" separates
premises from conclusion; it may be read "therefore". The second column
lists the medieval mnemonic name associated with the inference (these
are still widely used, and each is actually a mnemonic for Aristotle's
proof of the mood in question). The third column briefly summarizes
Aristotle's procedure for demonstrating the deduction.
Table of the Deductions in the Figures
| Form |
Mnemonic |
Proof |
| Aab, Abc
Aac |
Barbara |
Perfect |
| Eab, Abc
Eac |
Celarent |
Perfect |
| Aab, Ibc
Iac |
Darii |
Perfect; also by impossibility, from Camestres |
| Eab, Ibc
Oac |
Ferio |
Perfect; also by impossibility, from Cesare |
| SECOND FIGURE |
| Eab, Aac
Ebc |
Cesare |
(Eab, Aac)→(Eba,
Aac)CelEbc |
| Aab, Eac
Ebc |
Camestres |
(Aab, Eac)→(Aab, Eca)=(Eca,
Aab)CelEcb→Ebc |
| Eab, Iac
Obc |
Festino |
(Eab, Iac)→(Eba,
Iac)FerObc |
| Aab, Oac
Obc |
Baroco |
(Aab, Oac
+Abc)Bar(Aac,
Oac)ImpObc |
| THIRD FIGURE |
| Aac, Abc
IabDarapti |
(Aac, Abc)→(Aac,
Icb)DarIab |
| Eac, Abc
Oab |
Felapton |
(Eac, Abc)→(Eac,
Icb)FerOab |
| Iac, Abc
Iab |
Disamis |
(Iac, Abc)→(Ica, Abc)=(Abc,
Ica)DarIba→Iab |
| Aac, Ibc
Iab |
Datisi |
(Aac, Ibc)→(Aac,
Icb)DarIab |
| Oac, Abc
Oab |
Bocardo |
(Oac, +Aab,
Abc)Bar(Aac,
Oac)ImpOab |
| Eac, Ibc
Oab |
Ferison |
(Eac, Ibc)→(Eac,
Icb)FerOab |
Having established which deductions in the figures are possible,
Aristotle draws a number of metatheoretical conclusions, including:
- No deduction has two negative premises
- No deduction has two particular premises
- A deduction with an affirmative conclusion must have two
affirmative premises
- A deduction with a negative conclusion must have one negative
premise.
- A deduction with a universal conclusion must have two universal
premises
He also proves the following metatheorem:
All deductions can be reduced to the two universal
deductions in the first figure.
His proof of this is elegant. First, he shows that the two particular
deductions of the first figure can be reduced, by proof through
impossibility, to the universal deductions in the second figure:
(Darii) (Aab, Ibc,
+Eac)Camestres(Ebc,
Ibc)ImpIac
(Ferio) (Eab, Ibc,
+Aac)Cesare(Ebc,
Ibc)ImpOac
He then observes that since he has already shown how to reduce all the
particular deductions in the other figures except Baroco and Bocardo to
Darii and Ferio, these deductions can thus be reduced
to Barbara and Celarent. This proof is strikingly
similar both in structure and in subject to modern proofs of the
redundancy of axioms in a system.
Many more metatheoretical results, some of them quite sophisticated,
are proved in Prior Analytics I.45 and in Prior
Analytics II. As noted below, some of Aristotle's metatheoretical
results are appealed to in the epistemological arguments of the
Posterior Analytics.
Aristotle follows his treatment of "arguments in the figures" with a
much longer, and much more problematic, discussion of what happens to
these figured arguments when we add the qualifications "necessarily"
and "possibly" to their premises in various ways. In contrast to the
syllogistic itself (or, as commentators like to call it, the
assertoric syllogistic), this modal syllogistic
appears to be much less satisfactory and is certainly far more
difficult to interpret. Here, I only outline Aristotle's treatment of
this subject and note some of the principal points of interpretive
controversy.
5.6.1 The Definitions of the Modalities
Modern modal logic treats necessity and possibility as interdefinable:
"necessarily P" is equivalent to "not possibly not P", and "possibly P"
to "not necessarily not P". Aristotle gives these same equivalences in
On Interpretation. However, in Prior Analytics, he
makes a distinction between two notions of possibility. On the first,
which he takes as his preferred notion, "possibly P" is equivalent to
"not necessarily P and not necessarily not P". He then acknowledges an
alternative definition of possibility according to the modern
equivalence, but this plays only a secondary role in his system.
5.6.2 Aristotle's General Approach
Aristotle builds his treatment of modal syllogisms on his account of
non-modal (assertoric) syllogisms: he works his way
through the syllogisms he has already proved and considers the
consequences of adding a modal qualification to one or both premises.
Most often, then, the questions he explores have the form: "Here is an
assertoric syllogism; if I add these modal qualifications to the
premises, then what modally qualified form of the conclusion (if any)
follows?". A premise can have one of three modalities: it can be
necessary, possible, or assertoric. Aristotle works through the
combinations of these in order:
- Two necessary premises
- One necessary and one assertoric premise
- Two possible premises
- One assertoric and one possible premise
- One necessary and one possible premise
Though he generally considers only premise combinations which syllogize
in their assertoric forms, he does sometimes extend this; similarly, he
sometimes considers conclusions in addition to those which would follow
from purely assertoric premises.
Since this is his procedure, it is convenient to describe modal
syllogisms in terms of the corresponding non-modal syllogism plus a
triplet of letters indicating the modalities of premises and
conclusion: N = "necessary", P = "possible", A = "assertoric". Thus,
"Barbara NAN" would mean "The form Barbara with necessary
major premise, assertoric minor premise, and necessary conclusion". I
use the letters "N" and "P" as prefixes for premises as well; a premise
with no prefix is assertoric. Thus, Barbara NAN would be NAab,
Abc
NAac.
5.6.3 Modal Conversions
As in the case of assertoric syllogisms, Aristotle makes use of
conversion rules to prove validity. The conversion rules for necessary
premises are exactly analogous to those for assertoric premises:
- NEab→NEba
- NIab→NIba
- NAab→NIba
Possible premises behave differently, however. Since he defines
"possible" as "neither necessary nor impossible", it turns out that
x is possibly F entails, and is entailed by, x is possibly
not F. Aristotle generalizes this to the case of categorical
sentences as follows:
- PAab→PEab
- PEab→PAab
- PIab→POab
- POab→PIab
In addition, Aristotle uses the intermodal principle N→A: that is,
a necessary premise entails the corresponding assertoric one. However,
because of his definition of possibility, the principle A→P does
not generally hold: if it did, then N→P would hold, but on his
definition "necessarily P" and "possibly P" are actually inconsistent
("possibly P" entails "possibly not P").
This leads to a further complication. The denial of "possibly P" for
Aristotle is "either necessarily P or necessarily not P". The denial of
"necessarily P" is still more difficult to express in terms of a
combination of modalities: "either possibly P (and thus possibly not P)
or necessarily not P" This is important because of Aristotle's proof
procedures, which include proof through impossibility. If we give a
proof through impossibility in which we assume a necessary premise,
then the conclusion we ultimately establish is simply the denial of
that necessary premise, not a "possible" conclusion in Aristotle's
sense. Such propositions do occur in his system, but only in exactly
this way, i.e., as conclusions established by proof through
impossiblity from necessary assumptions. Somewhat confusingly,
Aristotle calls such propositions "possible" but immediately adds " not
in the sense defined": in this sense, "possibly Oab" is simply the
denial of "necessarily Aab". Such propositions appear only as premises,
never as conclusions.
5.6.4 Syllogisms with Necessary Premises
Aristotle holds that an assertoric syllogism remains valid if
"necessarily" is added to its premises and its conclusion: the modal
pattern NNN is always valid. He does not treat this as a trivial
consequence but instead offers proofs; in all but two cases, these are
parallel to those offered for the assertoric case. The exceptions are
Baroco and Bocardo, which he proved in the assertoric
case through impossibility: attempting to use that method here would
require him to take the denial of a necessary O proposition as
hypothesis, raising the complication noted above, and he must resort to
a different form of proof instead.
5.6.5 NA/AN Combinations: The Problem of the "Two Barbaras" and
Other Difficulties
Since a necessary premise entails an assertoric premise, every AN or NA
combination of premises will entail the corresponding AA pair, and thus
the corresponding A conclusion. Thus, ANA and NAA syllogisms are always
valid. However, Aristotle holds that some, but not all, ANN and NAN
combinations are valid. Specifically, he accepts Barbara NAN
but rejects Barbara ANN. Almost from Aristotle's own time,
interpreters have found his reasons for this distinction obscure, or
unpersuasive, or both. Theophrastus, for instance, adopted the simpler
rule that the modality of the conclusion of a syllogism was always the
"weakest" modality found in either premise, where N is stronger than A
and A is stronger than P (and where P probably has to be defined as
"not necessarily not"). Other difficulties follow from the problem of
the "Two Barbaras", as it is often called, and it has often been
maintained that the modal syllogistic is inconsistent.
This subject quickly becomes too complex for summarizing in this
brief article. For further discussion, see Becker, McCall, Patterson,
van Rijen, Striker, Nortmann, Thom, and Thomason.
A demonstration (apodeixis) is "a deduction
that produces knowledge". Aristotle's Posterior Analytics
contains his account of demonstrations and their role in knowledge.
From a modern perspective, we might think that this subject moves
outside of logic to epistemology. From Aristotle's perspective,
however, the connection of the theory of sullogismoi with the
theory of knowledge is especially close.
The subject of the Posterior Analytics is
epistêmê. This is one of several Greek words that
can reasonably be translated "knowledge", but Aristotle is concerned
only with knowledge of a certain type (as will be explained below).
There is a long tradition of translating epistêmê
in this technical sense as science, and I shall follow
that tradition here. However, readers should not be misled by the use
of that word. In particular, Aristotle's theory of science cannot be
considered a counterpart to modern philosophy of science, at least not
without substantial qualifications.
We have scientific knowledge, according to Aristotle, when we
know:
the cause why the thing is, that it is the cause of this,
and that this cannot be otherwise. (Posterior Analytics
I.2)
This implies two strong conditions on what can be the object of
scientific knowledge:
- Only what is necessarily the case can be known scientifically
- Scientific knowledge is knowledge of causes
He then proceeds to consider what science so defined will consist in,
beginning with the observation that at any rate one form of science
consists in the possession of a demonstration
(apodeixis), which he defines as a "scientific deduction":
by "scientific" (epistêmonikon), I mean that
in virtue of possessing it, we have knowledge.
The remainder of Posterior Analytics I is largely concerned
with two tasks: spelling out the nature of demonstration and
demonstrative science and answering an important challenge to its very
possibility. Aristotle first tells us that a demonstration is a
deduction in which the premises are:
- true
- primary (prota)
- immediate (amesa, "without a
middle")
- better known or more familiar
(gnôrimôtera) than the conclusion
- prior to the conclusion
- causes (aitia) of the conclusion
The interpretation of all these conditions except the first has been
the subject of much controversy. Aristotle clearly thinks that science
is knowledge of causes and that in a demonstration, knowledge of the
premises is what brings about knowledge of the conclusion. The fourth
condition shows that the knower of a demonstration must be in some
better epistemic condition towards them, and so modern interpreters
often suppose that Aristotle has defined a kind of epistemic
justification here. However, as noted above, Aristotle is defining a
special variety of knowledge. Comparisons with discussions of
justification in modern epistemology may therefore be misleading.
The same can be said of the terms "primary", "immediate" and "better
known". Modern interpreters sometimes take "immediate" to mean
"self-evident"; Aristotle does say that an immediate proposition is one
"to which no other is prior", but (as I suggest in the next section)
the notion of priority involved is likely a notion of logical priority
that it is hard to detach from Aristotle's own logical theories.
"Better known" has sometimes been interpreted simply as "previously
known to the knower of the demonstration" (i.e., already known in
advance of the demonstration). However, Aristotle explicitly
distinguishes between what is "better known for us" with what is
"better known in itself" or "in nature" and says that he means the
latter in his definition. In fact, he says that the process of
acquiring scientific knowledge is a process of changing what
is better known "for us", until we arrive at that condition in which
what is better known in itself is also better known for us.
In Posterior Analytics I.2, Aristotle considers two challenges
to the possibility of science. One party (dubbed the "agnostics" by
Jonathan Barnes) began with the following two premises:
- Whatever is scientifically known must be demonstrated.
- The premises of a demonstration must be scientifically known.
They then argued that demonstration is impossible with the following
dilemma:
- If the premises of a demonstration are scientifically known, then
they must be demonstrated.
- The premises from which each premise are demonstrated must be
scientifically known.
- Either this process continues forever, creating an infinite regress
of premises, or it comes to a stop at some point.
- If it continues forever, then there are no first premises from
which the subsequent ones are demonstrated, and so nothing is
demonstrated.
- On the other hand, if it comes to a stop at some point, then the
premises at which it comes to a stop are undemonstrated and therefore
not scientifically known; consequently, neither are any of the others
deduced from them.
- Therefore, nothing can be demonstrated.
A second group accepted the agnostics' view that scientific knowledge
comes only from demonstration but rejected their conclusion by
rejecting the dilemma. Instead, they maintained:
- Demonstration "in a circle" is possible, so that it is possible for
all premises also to be conclusions and therefore demonstrated.
Aristotle does not give us much information about how circular
demonstration was supposed to work, but the most plausible
interpretation would be supposing that at least for some set of
fundamental principles, each principle could be deduced from the
others. (Some modern interpreters have compared this position to a
coherence theory of knowledge.) However their position worked, the
circular demonstrators claimed to have a third alternative avoiding the
agnostics' dilemma, since circular demonstration gives us a regress
that is both unending (in the sense that we never reach premises at
which it comes to a stop) and finite (because it works its way round
the finite circle of premises).
Aristotle rejects circular demonstration as an incoherent notion on the
grounds that the premises of any demonstration must be prior (in an
appropriate sense) to the conclusion, whereas a circular demonstration
would make the same premises both prior and posterior to one another
(and indeed every premise prior and posterior to itself). He agrees
with the agnostics' analysis of the regress problem: the only plausible
options are that it continues indefinitely or that it "comes to a stop"
at some point. However, he thinks both the agnostics and the circular
demosntrators are wrong in maintaining that scientific knowledge is
only possible by demonstration from premises scientifically known:
instead, he claims, there is another form of knowledge possible for the
first premises, and this provides the starting points for
demonstrations.
To solve this problem, Aristotle needs to do something quite
specific. It will not be enough for him to establish that we can have
knowledge of some propositions without demonstrating them:
unless it is in turn possible to deduce all the other propositions of a
science from them, we shall not have solved the regress problem.
Moreover (and obviously), it is no solution to this problem for
Aristotle simply to assert that we have knowledge without
demonstration of some appropriate starting points. He does indeed say
that it is his position that we have such knowledge (An. Post.
I.2,), but he owes us an account of why that should be so.
Aristotle's account of knowledge of the indemonstrable first premises
of sciences is found in Posterior Analytics II.19, long
regarded as a difficult text to interpret. Briefly, what he says there
is that it is another cognitive state, nous (translated
variously as "insight", "intuition", "intelligence"), which knows them.
There is wide disagreement among commentators about the interpretation
of his account of how this state is reached; I will offer one possible
interpretation. First, Aristotle identifies his problem as explaining
how the principles can "become familiar to us", using the same term
"familiar" (gnôrimos) that he used in presenting the
regress problem. What he is presenting, then, is not a method of
discovery but a process of becoming wise. Second, he says that in order
for knowledge of immediate premises to be possible, we must have a kind
of knowledge of them without having learned it, but this knowledge must
not be as "precise" as the knowledge that a possessor of science must
have. The kind of knowledge in question turns out to be a capacity or
power (dunamis) which Aristotle compares to the the capacity
for sense-perception: since our senses are innate, i.e., develop
naturally, it is in a way correct to say that we know what e.g. all the
colors look like before we have seen them: we have the capacity to see
them by nature, and when we first see a color we exercise this capacity
without having to learn how to do so first. Likewise, Aristotle holds,
our minds have by nature the capacity to recognize the starting points
of the sciences.
In the case of sensation, the capacity for perception in the sense
organ is actualized by the operation on it of the perceptible object.
Similarly, Aristotle holds that coming to know first premises is a
matter of a potentiality in the mind being actualized by experience of
its proper objects: "The soul is of such a nature as to be capable of
undergoing this". So, although we cannot come to know the first
premises without the necessary experience, just as we cannot see colors
without the presence of colored objects, our minds are already so
constituted as to be able to recognize the right objects, just as our
eyes are already so constituted as to be able to perceive the colors
that exist.
It is considerably less clear what these objects are and how it is
that experience actualizes the relevant potentialities in the soul.
Aristotle describes a series of stages of cognition. First is what is
common to all animals: perception of what is present. Next is memory,
which he regards as a retention of a sensation: only some animals have
this capacity. Even fewer have the next capacity, the capacity to form
a single experience (empeiria) from many repetitions of the
same memory. Finally, many experiences repeated give rise to knowledge
of a single universal (katholou). This last capacity is
present only in humans.
See the article on
Aristotle's psychology
for more on his views about mind.
The definition (horos, horismos) was
an important matter for Plato and for the Early Academy. Concern with
answering the question "What is so-and-so?" are at the center of the
majority of Plato's dialogues, some of which (most elaborately the
Sophist) propound methods for finding definitions. External
sources (sometimes the satirical remarks of comedians) also reflect
this Academic concern with definitions. Aristotle himself traces the
quest for definitions back to Socrates.
For Aristotle, a definition is "an account which signifies what it is
to be for something" (logos ho to ti ên einai
sêmainei). The phrase "what it is to be" and its variants
are crucial: giving a definition is saying, of some existent thing,
what it is, not simply specifying the meaning of a word (Aristotle does
recognize definitions of the latter sort, but he has little interest in
them).
The notion of "what it is to be" for a thing is so pervasive in
Aristotle that it becomes formulaic: what a definition expresses is
"the what-it-is-to-be" (to ti ên einai). Roman
translators, vexed by this odd Greek phrase, devised a word for it,
essentia, from which our "essence" descends. So, an
Aristotelian definition is an account of the essence of something.
Since a definition defines an essence, only what has an essence can be
defined. What has an essence, then? That is one of the central
questions of Aristotle's metaphysics; once again, we must leave the
details to another article. In general, however, it is not individuals
but rather species (eidos: the word is one of
those Plato uses for "Form") that have essences. A species is defined
by giving its genus (genos) and its
differentia (diaphora): the genus is the kind
under which the species falls, and the differentia tells what
characterizes the species within that genus. As an example,
human might be defined as animal (the genus)
having the capacity to reason (the differentia).
Underlying Aristotle's concept of a definition is the concept of
essential predication (katêgoreisthai en
tôi ti esti, predication in the what it is). In any true
affirmative predication, the predicate either does or does not "say
what the subject is", i.e., the predicate either is or is not an
acceptable answer to the question "What is it?" asked of the subject.
Bucephalus is a horse, and a horse is an animal; so, "Bucephalus is a
horse" and "Bucephalus is an animal" are essential predications.
However, "Bucephalus is brown", though true, does not state what
Bucephalus us but only says something about him.
Since a thing's definition says what it is, definitions are
essentially predicated. However, not everything essentially predicated
is a definition. Since Bucephalus is a horse, and horses are a kind of
mammal, and mammals are a kind of animal, "horse" "mammal" and "animal"
are all essential predicates of Bucephalus. Moreover, since what a
horse is is a kind of mammal, "mammal" is an essential predicate of
horse. When predicate X is an essential predicate of Y but also of
other things, then X is a genus (genos) of
Y.
A definition of X must not only be essentially predicated of it but
must also be predicated only of it: to use a term from Aristotle's
Topics, a definition and what it defines must
"counterpredicate" (antikatêgoreisthai) with one
another. X counterpredicates with Y if X applies to what Y applies to
and conversely. Though X's definition must counterpredicate with X, not
everything that counterpredicates with X is its definition. "Capable of
laughing", for example, counterpredicates with "human" but fails to be
its definition. Such a predicate (non-essential but counterpredicating)
is a peculiar property or proprium
(idion).
Finally, if X is predicated of Y but is neither essential nor
counterpredicates, then X is an accident
(sumbebêkos) of Y.
Aristotle sometimes treats genus, peculiar property, definition, and
accident as including all possible predications (e.g. Topics
I). Later commentators listed these four and the differentia as the
five predicables, and as such they were of great
importance to late ancient and to medieval philosophy (e.g.,
Porphyry).
The notion of essential predication is connected to what are
traditionally called the categories
(katêgoriai). In a word, Aristotle is famous for having
held a "doctrine of categories". Just what that doctrine was, and
indeed just what a category is, are considerably more vexing questions.
They also quickly take us outside his logic and into his metaphysics.
Here, I will try to give a very general overview, beginning with the
somewhat simpler question "What categories are there?"
We can answer this question by listing the categories. Here are two
passages containing such lists:
We should distinguish the kinds of predication (ta
genê tôn katêgoriôn) in which the four
predications mentioned are found. These are ten in number: what-it-is,
quantity, quality, relative, where, when, being-in-a-position, having,
doing, undergoing. An accident, a genus, a peculiar property and a
definition will always be in one of these categories. (Topics
I.9, 103b20-25)
Of things said without any combination, each signifies either
substance or quantity or quality or a relative or where or when or
being-in-a-position or having or doing or undergoing. To give a rough
idea, examples of substance are man, horse; of quantity: four-foot,
five-foot; of quality: white, literate; of a relative: double, half,
larger; of where: in the Lyceum, in the market-place; of when:
yesterday, last year; of being-in-a-position: is-lying, is-sitting; of
having: has-shoes-on, has-armor-on; of doing: cutting, burning; of
undergoing: being-cut, being-burned. (Categories 4, 1b25-2a4,
tr. Ackrill, slightly modified)
These two passages give ten-item lists, identical except for their
first members. What are they lists of? Here are three ways
they might be interpreted:
The word "category" (katêgoria) means "predication".
Aristotle holds that predications and predicates can be grouped into
several largest "kinds of predication" (genê tôn
katêgoriôn). He refers to this classification
frequently, often calling the "kinds of predication" simply "the
predications", and this (by way of Latin) leads to our word
"category".
- First, the categories may be kinds of predicate:
predicates (or, more precisely, predicate expressions) can be divided
into ten separate classes, with each expression belonging to just one
class. This comports well with the root meaning of the word
katêgoria ("predication"). On this interpretation, the
categories arise out of considering the most general types of question
that can be asked about something: "What is it?"; "How
much is it?"; "What sort is it?"; "Where is
it?"; "What is it doing?" Answers appropriate to one
of these questions are nonsensical in response to another ("When is
it?" "A horse"). Thus, the categories may rule out certain kinds of
question as ill-formed or confused. This plays an important role in
Aristotle's metaphysics.
- Second, the categories may be seen as classifications of
predications, that is, kinds of relation that may hold between
the predicate and the subject of a predication. To say of Socrates that
he is human is to say what he is, whereas to say that he is
literate is not to say what he is but rather to give a quality that he
has. For Aristotle, the relation of predicate to subject in
these two sentences is quite different (in this respect he differs both
from Plato and from modern logicians). The categories may be
interpreted as ten different ways in which a predicate may be related
to its subject. This last division has importance for Aristotle's logic
as well as his metaphysics.
- Third, the categories may be seen as kinds of entity, as
highest genera or kinds of thing that are. A given thing can be
classified under a series of progressively wider genera: Socrates is a
human, a mammal, an animal, a living being. The categories are the
highest such genera. Each falls under no other genus, and each is
completely separate from the others. This distinction is of critical
importance to Aristotle's metaphysics.
Which of these interpretations fits best with the two passages above?
The answer appears to be different in the two cases. This is most
evident if we take note of point in which they differ: the
Categories lists substance (ousia)
in first place, while the Topics list
what-it-is (ti esti). A substance, for
Aristotle, is a type of entity, suggesting that the Categories
list is a list of types of entity.
On the other hand, the expression "what-it-is" suggests most
strongly a type of predication. Indeed, the Topics confirms
this by telling us that we can "say what it is" of an entity
falling under any of the categories:
an expression signifying what-it-is will sometimes signify
a substance, sometimes a quantity, sometimes a quality, and sometimes
one of the other categories.
As Aristotle explains, if I say that Socrates is a man, then I have
said what Socrates is and signified a substance; if I say that white is
a color, then I have said what white is and signified a quality; if I
say that some length is a foot long, then I have said what it is and
signified a quantity; and so on for the other categories. What-it-is,
then, here designates a kind of predication, not a kind of entity.
This might lead us to conclude that the categories in the
Topics are only to be interpreted as kinds of predicate or
predication, those in the Categories as kinds of being. Even
so, we would still want to ask what the relationship is between these
two nearly-identical lists of terms, given these distinct
interpretations. However, the situation is much more complicated.
First, there are dozens of other passages in which the categories
appear. Nowhere else do we find a list of ten, but we do find shorter
lists containing eight, or six, or five, or four of them (with
substance/what-it-is, quality, quantity, and relative the most common).
Aristotle describes what these lists are lists of in different ways:
they tell us "how being is divided", or "how many ways being is said",
or "the figures of predication" (ta schêmata tês
katêgorias). The designation of the first category also varies:
we find not only "substance" and "what it is" but also the expressions
"this" or "the this" (tode ti, to tode, to
ti). These latter expressions are closely associated with, but not
synonymous with, substance. He even combines the latter with
"what-it-is" (Metaphysics Z 1, 1028a10: "… one sense
signifies what it is and the this, one signifies quality
…").
Moreover, substances are for Aristotle fundamental for predication
as well as metaphysically fundamental. He tells us that everything that
exists exists because substances exist: if there were no substances,
there would not be anything else. He also conceives of predication as
reflecting a metaphysical relationship (or perhaps more than one,
depending on the type of predication). The sentence "Socrates is pale"
gets its truth from a state of affairs consisting of a substance
(Socrates) and a quality (whiteness) which is in that substance. At
this point we have gone far outside the realm of Aristotle's logic into
his metaphysics, the fundamental question of which, according to
Aristotle, is "What is a substance?". (For further discussion of this
topic, see the entry on
Aristotle's metaphysics,
and in particular,
Section 2
on the
categories.)
See Frede 1981, Ebert 1985 for additional discussion of Aristotle's
lists of categories.
For convenience of reference, I include a table of the categories,
along with Aristotle's examples and the traditional names often used
for them. For reasons explained above, I have treated the first item in
the list quite differently, since an example of a substance and an
example of a what-it-is are necessarily (as one might put it) in
different categories.
| Traditional name |
Literally |
Greek |
Examples |
| (Substance) |
substance
"this"
what-it-is |
ousia
tode ti
ti esti |
man, horse
Socrates
"Socrates is a man" |
| Quantity |
How much |
poson |
four-foot, five-foot |
| Quality |
What sort |
poion |
white, literate |
| Relation |
related to what |
pros ti |
double, half, greater |
| Location |
Where |
pou |
in the Lyceum, in the marketplace |
| Time |
when |
pote |
yesterday, last year |
| Position |
being situated |
keisthai |
lies, sits |
| Habit |
having, possession |
echein |
is shod, is armed |
| Action |
doing |
poiein |
cuts, burns |
| Passion |
undergoing |
paschein |
is cut, is burned |
In the Sophist, Plato introduces a procedure of "Division" as
a method for discovering definitions. To find a definition of X, first
locate the largest kind of thing under which X falls; then, divide that
kind into two parts, and decide which of the two X falls into. Repeat
this method with the part until X has been fully located.
This method is part of Aristotle's Platonic legacy. His attitude
towards it, however, is complex. He adopts a view of the proper
structure of definitions that is closely allied to it: a correct
definition of X should give the genus (genos:
kind or family) of X, which tells what kind of thing X is, and the
differentia (diaphora: difference) which
uniquely identifies X within that genus. Something defined in this way
is a species (eidos: the term is one of
Plato's terms for "Form"), and the differentia is thus the "difference
that makes a species" (eidopoios diaphora, "specific
difference"). In Posterior Analytics II.13, he gives his own
account of the use of Division in finding definitions.
However, Aristotle is strongly critical of the Platonic view of
Division as a method for establishing definitions. In
Prior Analytics I.31, he contrasts Division with the
syllogistic method he has just presented, arguing that Division cannot
actually prove anything but rather assumes the very thing it is
supposed to be proving. He also charges that the partisans of Division
failed to understand what their own method was capable of proving.
Closely related to this is the discussion, in Posterior
Analytics II.3-10, of the question whether there can be both
definition and demonstration of the same thing. Since the definitions
Aristotle is interested in are statements of essences, knowing a
definition is knowing, of some existing thing, what it is.
Consequently, Aristotle's question amounts to a question whether
defining and demonstrating can be alternative ways of acquiring the
same knowledge. His reply is complex:
- Not everything demonstrable can be known by finding definitions,
since all definitions are universal and affirmative whereas some
demonstrable propositions are negative.
- If a thing is demonstrable, then to know it just is to possess its
demonstration; therefore, it cannot be known just by definition.
- Nevertheless, some definitions can be understood as demonstrations
differently arranged.
As an example of case 3, Aristotle considers the definition "Thunder is
the extinction of fire in the clouds". He sees this as a compressed and
rearranged form of this demonstration:
- Sound accompanies the extinguishing of fire.
- Fire is extinguished in the clouds.
- Therefore, a sound occurs in the clouds.
We can see the connection by considering the answers to two questions:
"What is thunder?" "The extinction of fire in the clouds" (definition).
"Why does it thunder?" "Because fire is extinguished in the clouds"
(demonstration).
As with his criticisms of Division, Aristotle is arguing for the
superiority of his own concept of science to the Platonic concept.
Knowledge is composed of demonstrations, even if it may also include
definitions; the method of science is demonstrative, even if it may
also include the process of defining.
Aristotle often contrasts dialectical arguments with
demonstrations. The difference, he tells us, is in the character of
their premises, not in their logical structure: whether an argument is
a sullogismos is only a matter of whether its conclusion
results of necessity from its premises. The premises of demonstrations
must be true and primary, that is, not only true but also
prior to their conclusions in the way explained in the Posterior
Analytics. The premises of dialectical deductions, by contrast,
must be accepted (endoxos).
Recent scholars have proposed different interpretations of the term
endoxos. Aristotle often uses this adjective as a substantive:
ta endoxa, "accepted things", "accepted opinions". On one
understanding, descended from the work of G. E. L. Owen and developed
more fully by Jonathan Barnes and especially Terence Irwin, the
endoxa are a compilation of views held by various people with
some form or other of standing: "the views of fairly reflective people
after some reflection", in Irwin's phrase. Dialectic is then simply "a
method of argument from [the] common beliefs [held by these people]".
For Irwin, then, endoxa are "common beliefs". Jonathan Barnes,
noting that endoxa are opinions with a certain standing,
translates with "reputable".
My own view is that Aristotle's texts support a somewhat different
understanding. He also tells us that dialectical premises differ from
demonstrative ones in that the former are questions, whereas
the latter are assumptions or assertions: "the
demonstrator does not ask, but takes", he says. This fits most
naturally with a view of dialectic as argument directed at another
person by question and answer and consequently taking as premises that
other person's concessions. Anyone arguing in this manner will, in
order to be successful, have to ask for premises which the interlocutor
is liable to accept, and the best way to be successful at that is to
have an inventory of acceptable premises, i.e., premises that are in
fact acceptable to people of different types.
In fact, we can discern in the Topics (and the
Rhetoric, which Aristotle says depends on the art explained in
the Topics) an art of dialectic for use in such arguments. My
reconstruction of this art (which would not be accepted by all
scholars) is as follows.
Given the above picture of dialectical argument, the dialectical art
will consist of two elements. One will be a method for discovering
premises from which a given conclusion follows, while the other will be
a method for determining which premises a given interlocutor will be
likely to concede. The first task is accomplished by developing a
system for classifying premises according to their logical structure.
We might expect Aristotle to avail himself here of the syllogistic, but
in fact he develops quite another approach, one that seems less
systematic and rests on various "common" terms. The second task is
accomplished by developing lists of the premises which are acceptable
to various types of interlocutor. Then, once one knows what sort of
person one is dealing with, one can choose premises accordingly.
Aristotle stresses that, as in all arts, the dialectician must study,
not what is acceptable to this or that specific person, but what is
acceptable to this or that type of person, just as the doctor studies
what is healthful for different types of person: "art is of the
universal".
The method presented in the Topics for classifying arguments
relies on the presence in the conclusion of certain "common" terms
(koina) -- common in the sense that they are not peculiar to
any subject matter but may play a role in arguments about anything
whatever. We find enumerations of arguments involving these terms in a
similar order several times. Typically, they include:
- Opposites (antikeimena, antitheseis)
- Contraries (enantia)
- Contradictories (apophaseis)
- Possession and Privation (hexis kai sterêsis)
- Relatives (pros ti)
- Cases (ptôseis)
- "More and Less and Likewise"
The four types of opposites are the best represented.
Each designates a type of term pair, i.e., a way two terms can be
opposed to one another. Contraries are polar opposites
or opposed extremes such as hot and cold, dry and wet, good and bad. A
pair of contradictories consists of a term and its
negation: good, not good. A possession (or condition)
and privation are illustrated by sight and blindness.
Relatives are relative terms in the modern sense: a
pair consists of a term and its correlative, e.g. large and small,
parent and child.
The argumentative patterns Aristotle associated with
cases generally involve inferring a sentence contaning
adverbial or declined forms from another sentence containing different
forms of the same word stem: "if what is useful is good, then what is
done usefully is done well and the useful person is good". In
Hellenistic grammatical usage, ptôsis meant "case" (e.g.
nominative, dative, accusative); Aristotle's use here is obviously an
early form of that.
Under the heading more and less and likewise,
Aristotle groups a somewhat motley assortment of argument patterns all
involving, in some way or other, the terms "more", "less", and
"likewise". Examples: "If whatever is A is B, then whatever is more
(less) A is more (less) B"; "If A is more likely B than C is, and A is
not B, then neither is C"; "If A is more likely than B and B is the
case, then A is the case".
At the heart of the Topics is a collection of what Aristotle
calls topoi, "places" or "locations". Unfortunately, though it
is clear that he intends most of the Topics (Books II-VI) as a
collection of these, he never explicitly defines this term.
Interpreters have consequently disagreed considerably about just what a
topos is. A discussion may be found in Brunschwig 1967,
Slomkowski 1996, Primavesi 1997, and Smith 1997.
An art of dialectic will be useful wherever dialectical
argument is useful. Aristotle mentions three such uses; each merits
some comment.
First, there appears to have been a form of stylized argumentative
exchange practiced in the Academy in Aristotle's time. The main
evidence for this is simply Aristotle's Topics, especially
Book VIII, which makes frequent reference to rule-governed procedures,
apparently taking it for granted that the audience will understand
them. In these exchanges, one participant took the role of answerer,
the other the role of questioner. The answerer began by asserting some
proposition (a thesis: "position" or "acceptance"). The
questioner then asked questions of the answerer in an attempt to secure
concessions from which a contradiction could be deduced: that is, to
refute (elenchein) the answerer's position.
The questioner was limited to questions that could be answered by yes
or no; generally, the answerer could only respond with yes or no,
though in some cases answeres could object to the form of a question.
Answerers might undertake to answer in accordance with the views of a
particular type of person or a particular person (e.g. a famous
philosopher), or they might answer according to their own beliefs.
There appear to have been judges or scorekeepers for the process.
Gymnastic dialectical contests were sometimes, as the name suggests,
for the sake of exercise in developing argumentative skill, but they
may also have been pursued as a part of a process of inquiry.
Aristotle also mentions an "art of making trial", or a variety of
dialectical argument that "puts to the test" (the Greek word is the
adjective peirastikê, in the feminine: such expressions
often designate arts or skills, e.g. rhêtorikê,
"the art of rhetoric"). Its function is to examine the claims of those
who say they have some knowledge, and it can practiced by someone who
does not possess the knowledge in question. The examination is a matter
of refutation, based on the principle that whoever knows a subject must
have consistent beliefs about it: so, if you can show me that my
beliefs about something lead to a contradiction, then you have shown
that I do not have knowledge about it.
This is strongly reminiscent of Socrates' style of interrogation,
from which it is almost certainly descended. In fact, Aristotle often
indicates that dialectical argument is by nature refutative.
Dialectical refutation cannot of itself establish any proposition
(except perhaps the proposition that some set of propositions is
inconsistent). More to the point, though deducing a contradiction from
my beliefs may show that they do not constitute knowledge, failure to
deduce a contradiction from them is no proof that they are true. Not
surprisingly, then, Aristotle often insists that "dialectic does not
prove anything" and that the dialectical art is not some sort of
universal knowledge.
In Topics I.2, however, Aristotle says that the art of
dialectic is useful in connection with "the philosophical sciences".
One reason he gives for this follows closely on the refutative
function: if we have subjected our opinions (and the opinions of our
fellows, and of the wise) to a thorough refutative examination, we will
be in a much better position to judge what is most likely true and
false. In fact, we find just such a procedure at the start of many of
Aristotle's treatises: an enumeration of the opinions current about the
subject together with a compilation of "puzzles" raised by these
opinions. Aristotle has a special term for this kind of review: a
diaporia, a "puzzling through".
He adds a second use that is both more difficult to understand and
more intriguing. The Posterior Analytics argues that if
anything can be proved, then not everything that is known is known as a
result of proof. What alternative means is there whereby the first
principles of sciences are known? Aristotle's own answer as found in
Posterior Analytics II.19 is difficult to interpret, and
recent philosophers have often found it unsatisfying since (as often
construed) it appears to commit Aristotle to a form of apriorism or
rationalism both indefensible in itself and not consonant with his own
insistence on the indispensability of empirical inquiry in natural
science.
Against this background, the following passage in Topics
I.2 may have special importance:
It is also useful in connection with the first things
concerning each of the sciences. For it is impossible to say anything
about the science under consideration on the basis of its own
principles, since the principles are first of all, and we must work our
way through about these by means of what is generally accepted about
each. But this is peculiar, or most proper, to dialectic: for since it
is examinative with respect to the principles of all the sciences, it
has a way to proceed.
A number of interpreters (beginning with Owen 1961) have built on this
passage and others to find dialectic at the heart of Aristotle's
philosophical method. Further discussion of this issue would take us
far beyond the subject of this article (the fullest development is in
Irwin 1988; see also Nussbaum 1986 and, for criticism, Hamlyn 1990,
Smith 1997).
Aristotle says that rhetoric, i.e., the study of persuasive speech, is
a "counterpart" (antistrophos) of dialectic and that the
rhetorical art is a kind of "outgrowth" (paraphues ti) of
dialectic and the study of character types. The correspondence with
dialectical method is straightforward: rhetorical speeches, like
dialectical arguments, seek to persuade others to accept certain
conclusions on the basis of premises they already accept. Therefore,
the same measures useful in dialectical contexts will, mutatis
mutandis, be useful here: knowing what premises an audience of a given
type is likely to believe, and knowing how to find premises from which
the desired conclusion follows.
The Rhetoric does fit this general description: Aristotle
includes both discussions of types of person or audience (with
generalizations about what each type tends to believe) and a summary
version (in II.23) of the argument patterns discussed in the
Topics. For further discussion of his rhetoric see
Aristotle's rhetoric.
Demonstrations and dialectical arguments are both forms of valid
argument, for Aristotle. However, he also studies what he calls
contentious (eristikos) or
sophistical arguments: these he defines as arguments
which only apparently establish their conclusions. In fact, Aristotle
defines these as apparent (but not genuine) dialectical
sullogismoi. They may have this appearance in either of two
ways:
- Arguments in which the conclusion only appears to follow of
necessity from the premises (apparent, but not genuine,
sullogismoi).
- Genuine sullogismois the premises of which are merely
apparently, but not genuinely, acceptable.
Arguments of the first type in modern terms, appear to be valid but are
really invalid. Arguments of the second type are at first more
perplexing: given that acceptability is a matter of what people
believe, it might seem that whatever appears to be endoxos
must actually be endoxos. However, Aristotle probably has in
mind arguments with premises that may at first glance seem to
be acceptable but which, upon a moment's reflection, we immediately
realize we don not actually accept. Consider this example from
Aristotle's time:
- Whatever you have not lost, you still have.
- You have not lost horns.
- Therefore, you still have horns
This is transparently bad, but the problem is not that it is invalid:
the problem is rather that the first premise, though superficially
plausible, is false. In fact, anyone with a little ability to follow an
argument will realize that at once upon seeing this very argument.
Aristotle's study of sophistical arguments is contained in On
Sophistical Refutations, which is actually a sort of appendix to
the Topics.
To a remarkable extent, contemporary discussions of fallacies
reproduce Aristotle's own classifications. See Dorion 1995 for further
discussion.
Two frequent themes of Aristotle's account of science are (1) that the
first principles of sciences are not demonstrable and (2) that there is
no single universal science including all other sciences as its parts.
"All things are not in a single genus", he says, "and even if they
were, all beings could not fall under the same principles" (On
Sophistical Refutations 11). Thus, it is exactly the universal
applicability of dialectic that leads him to deny it the status of a
science.
In Metaphysics IV (Γ), however, Aristotle takes what
appears to be a different view. First, he argues that there is, in a
way, a science that takes being as its genus (his name for it is "first
philosophy"). Second, he argues that the principles of this science
will be, in a way, the first principles of all (though he does not
claim that the principles of other sciences can be demonstrated from
them). Third, he identifies one of its first principles as the "most
secure" of all principles: the principle of non-contradiction. As he
states it,
It is impossible for the same thing to belong and not
belong simultaneously to the same thing in the same respect
(Met. )
This is the most secure of all principles, Aristotle tells us, because
"it is impossible to be in error about it". Since it is a first
principle, it cannot be demonstrated; those who think otherwise are
"uneducated in analytics". However, Aristotle then proceeds to give
what he calls a "refutative demonstration" (apodeixai
elenktikôs) of this principle.
Further discussion of this principle and Aristotle's arguments
concerning it belong to a treatment of his metaphysics (see
Aristotle: Metaphysics).
However,
it should be noted that: (1) these arguments draw on Aristotle's views
about logic to a greater extent than any treatise outside the logical
works themselves; (2) in the logical works, the principle of
non-contradiction is one of Aristotle's favorite illustrations of the
"common principles" (koinai archai) that underlie the art of
dialectic.
See
Aristotle's Metaphysics,
Dancy 1975, Code 1986 for further discussion.
The passage in Aristotle's logical works which has received perhaps the
most intense discussion in recent decades is On Interpretation
9, where Aristotle discusses the question whether every proposition
about the future must be either true or false. Though something of a
side issue in its context, the passage raises a problem of great
importance to Aristotle's near contemporaries (and perhaps
contemporaries).
A contradiction (antiphasis) is a pair of
propositions one of which asserts what the other denies. A major goal
of On Interpretation is to discuss the thesis that, of every
such contradiction, one member must be true and the other false. In the
course of his discussion, Aristotle allows for some exceptions. One
case is what he calls indefinite propositions such as
"A man is walking": nothing prevents both this proposition and "A man
is not walking" being simultaneously true. This exception can be
explained on relatively simple grounds.
A different exception arises for more complex reasons. Consider
these two propositions:
- There will be a sea-battle tomorrow
- There will not be a sea-battle tomorrow
It seems that exactly one of these must be true and the other false.
But if (1) is now true, then there must be a
sea-battle tomorrow, and there cannot fail to be a sea-battle
tomorrow. The result, according to this puzzle, is that nothing is
possible except what actually happens: there are no unactualized
possibilities.
Such a conclusion is, as Aristotle is quick to note, a problem both
for his own metaphysical views about potentialities and for the
commonsense notion that some things are up to us. He therefore proposes
another exception to the general thesis concerning contradictory
pairs.
This much would probably be accepted by most interpreters. What the
restriction is, however, and just what motivates it are matters of wide
disagreement. It has been proposed, for instance, that Aristotle
adopted, or at least flirted with, a three-valued logic for future
propositions, or that he countenanced truth-value gaps, or that his
solution includes still more abstruse reasoning. The literature is much
too complex to summarize: see Anscombe, Hintikka, D. Frede, Whitaker,
Waterlow.
Historically, at least, it is likely that Aristotle is responding to
an argument originating in the Megarian School. He ascribes the view
that only that which happens is possible to the Megarians in
Metaphysics IX (Θ). The puzzle with which he is
concerned strongly recalls the "Master Argument" of Diodorus Cronus,
especially in certain further details. For instance, Aristotle imagines
the statement about tomorrow's sea battle having been uttered ten
thousand years ago. If it was true, then its truth was a fact about the
past; if the past is now unchangeable, then so is the truth value of
that past utterance. This recalls the Master Argument's premise that
"what is past is necessary". Diodorus Cronus was active a little after
Aristotle, and he was a Megarian (see Dorion 1995 for criticism of
David Sedley's attempt to reject this). It seems to me reasonable to
conclude that Aristotle's target here is some Megarian argument,
perhaps an earlier version of the Master.
- Accept: tithenai (in a dialectical argument)
- Accepted: endoxos (also ‘reputable’
‘common belief’)
- Accident: sumbebêkos (see incidental)
- Accidental: kata sumbebêkos
- Affirmation: kataphasis
- Affirmative: kataphatikos
- Assertion: apophansis (sentence with a truth value,
declarative sentence)
- Assumption: hupothesis
- Belong: huparchein
- Category: katêgoria (see the discussion in Section
7.3).
- Contradict: antiphanai
- Contradiction: antiphasis (in the sense "contradictory
pair of propositions" and also in the sense "denial of a
proposition")
- Contrary: enantion
- Deduction: sullogismos
- Definition: horos, horismos
- Demonstration: apodeixis
- Denial (of a proposition): apophasis
- Dialectic: dialektikê (the art of
dialectic)
- Differentia: diaphora; specific difference, eidopoios
diaphora
- Direct: deiktikos (of proofs; opposed to "through the
impossible")
- Essence: to ti esti, to ti ên einai
- Essential: en tôi ti esti (of predications)
- Extreme: akron (of the major and minor terms of a
deduction)
- Figure: schêma
- Form: eidos (see also Species)
- Genus: genos
- Immediate: amesos ("without a middle")
- Impossible: adunaton; "through the impossible" (dia
tou adunatou), of some proofs.
- Incidental: see Accidental
- Induction: epagôgê
- Middle, middle term (of a deduction): meson
- Negation (of a term): apophasis
- Objection: enstasis
- Particular: en merei, epi meros (of a
proposition); kath'hekaston (of individuals)
- Peculiar, Peculiar Property: idios, idion
- Possible: dunaton, endechomenon;
endechesthai (verb: "be possible")
- Predicate: katêgorein (verb);
katêegoroumenon ("what is predicated")
- Predication: katêgoria (act or instance of
predicating, type of predication)
- Primary: prôton
- Principle: archê (starting point of a
demonstration)
- Quality: poion
- Reduce, Reduction: anagein,
anagôgê
- Refute: elenchein; refutation, elenchos
- Science: epistêmê
- Species: eidos
- Specific: eidopoios (of a differentia that "makes a
species", eidopoios diaphora)
- Subject: hupokeimenon
- Substance: ousia
- Term: horos
- Universal: katholou (both of propositions and of
individuals)
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[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
Aristotle: mathematics |
Aristotle: metaphysics |
Aristotle: poetics |
Aristotle: rhetoric |
Chrysippus |
Diodorus Cronus |
future contingents |
logic: ancient |
logic: relevance |
Megarian School |
square of opposition |
Stoicism
Acknowledgements
I am indebted to Alan Code, Marc Cohen, and Theodor Ebert for helpful
criticisms of earlier versions of this article
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