Peirce's Logic

In contrast to Frege's highly systematic and thoroughly developed work in logic, Peirce's work remains fragmentary and extensive, rich with profound ideas but most of them left in a rough and incomplete form. Three of the Peirce's contributions to logic that are not as well-known as others are described below:

• 1. Three-Valued Logic
• 2. Calculus of Relations
• 3. Existential Graphs
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

Among Peirce's other contributions to logic are: (i) quantification theory (see Peirce (1885) and Berry (1952)), (ii) propositional logic (see Berry (1952)), (iii) Boolean algebra (see Lewis (1918)), and (iv) “Peirce's Remarkable Theorem” (see Herzberger (1981) and Berry (1952)).

1. Three-Valued Logic

In his notes, Peirce experiments with three symbols representing truth values: V, L, and F. He associates V with “1” and “T”, indicating truth. He associates F with “0” and “F”, indicating falsehood. He associates L with “1/2” and “N”, indicating perhaps an intermediate or unknown value.

Peirce defines a large number of unary and binary operators on these three truth values. The semantics for the operators is indicated by truth tables. Two examples are given here. First, the bar operator (indicated here by a minus sign) is defined as follows:

x		V	L	F
-x		F	L	V

Applied to truth the bar operator yields falsehood, applied to unknown it yields unknown and applied to falsehood it yields truth.

The Z operator is a binary operator which Peirce defines as follows:

		V	L	F
V	|	V	L	F
L	|	L	L	F
F	|	F	F	F

The bar operator and the Z operator provide the essentials of a truth-functionally complete strong Kleene semantics for three-valued logic. In addition to these two strong Kleene operators, Peirce defines several other forms of negation, conjunction, and disjunction. The notes also provide some basic properties of some of the operators, such as being symmetric and being associative.

2. Calculus of Relations

Given relative terms such as “friend of” and “enemy of” (more briefly “f” and “e”), Peirce studied various operations on these terms such as the following:

(union)

friend of or enemy of

(intersection)

friend of and enemy of

(relative product)

friend of an enemy of

(relative sum)

friend of every enemy of

(complement)

is not a friend of

(converse)

is one to whom the other is friend

Peirce presented numerous theorems involving his operations on relative terms. Examples of the numerous such laws identified by Peirce are:

~(r + s)	=	~r + ~s
-(r ; s)	=	-r , -s
(r . s) , t	=	(r , s) . (r , t)

Nevertheless, Peirce's calculus of relations has remained a topic of interest to this day as an alternative, algebraic approach to the logic of relations. It has been studied by Lowenheim, Tarski and others. Lowenheim's famous theorem was originally a result about the calculus of relations rather than quantification theory, as it is usually presented today. Some of the subsequent work on the calculus of relations is outlined in Maddux (1990).

3. Existential Graphs

The “alpha” portion of the system of existential graphs is concerned with propositional logic. Conjunction is indicated by juxtaposing graphs next to one another. Negation is indicated by enclosing a graph within an enclosed circle or other closed figure, which Peirce calls a “cut.” Here (and occasionally in Peirce's writings) cuts will be indicated by matching parentheses. So

(P)

(P(Q))

((Q)P)

Insertion in Odd
Any graph can be added to an area enclosed within an odd number of cuts.

The following table gives some examples of this rule:

((B))	(A (B (C)))	(A)
((B)A)	(A (B (C D)))	((B)A)

Erasure in Even
Any graph can be erased that occurs within an even number of cuts.

The following table gives some examples of this rule:

(A(B))	(A (B (C)))	B(A)
(A(  ))	(A (   (C)))	B

Iteration
Any graph can be recopied to any other area that occurs within all the cuts the original occurs within.

Here are some examples of Iteration:

(A(B))	( (A) (B) )	B(A)
(A(AB))	( (A) (B(A)) )	B(A)B(A)

Deiteration
Any graph that could have been obtained by iteration can be erased.

Here are some examples of Deiteration:

(A(AB))	( (A) (B(A)) )	B(A)B(A)
(A(B))	( (A) (B) )	B(A)

Double cut
Two cuts can be put immediately around any graph, and two cuts immediately around any graph can be erased.

Here are some examples of Double Cut:

(A(B))	(A)	((B))(A)
(((A))(B))	(((A)))	B(A)

A proof of modus ponens:

P	(P(Q))	premises: (i) if P then Q. (ii) P
P	( (Q))	Deiteration
P	Q	Double Cut
	Q	Erasure in Even

A proof of “if A, then if B then A”:

(( ))	Double Cut
(A( ))	Insertion in Odd
(A( A ))	Iteration
(A( ((A)) ))	Double Cut
(A( (B(A)) ))	Insertion in Odd

A proof of “if not B then not A” from “if A then B”:

(A(B))	premise
( ((A)) (B))	Double Cut

Finally, a proof of “if A then C” from “if A then B” and “if B then C”:

(A(B))  (B(C))	premises
(A( B (B(C)) )) ( B(C))	Iteration
(A( B (B(C)) ))	Erasure in Even
(A( B (  (C))  ))	Deiteration
(A( B     C     ))	Double Cut
(A(C))	Erasure in Even

The “beta” portion of Peirce's system of existential graphs is equivalent to first-order logic with identity. It does not use variables to fill the argument places of predicates. Instead, the argument places are filled by drawn lines. Two or more such argument places can be identified (analogous to filling them with the same variable) by connecting them with a drawn line. These “lines of identity” play the role of quantifiers as well as variables. The order of interpretation of the various lines of identity and cuts of a beta graph is determined by the portions of lines of identity that are enclosed within the fewest cuts. Elements enclosed by fewest cuts are interpreted before more deeply embedded elements. Rules of inference for the beta portion are generalizations of the rules for the alpha portion. They allow lines of identity to be manipulated in various ways, such as erasing portions of lines connecting loose ends, extending loose ends, and retracting loose ends. More information about the beta portion of the system of existential graphs can be found in Roberts (1973).

Bibliography

• Berry, George D. W. (1952) “Peirce's Contributions to the Logic of Statements and Quantifiers.” In P. Wiener and F. Young (Eds.) Studies in the Philosophy of Charles S. Peirce Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
• Burch, Robert W. (1991) A Peircean Reduction Thesis. Texas Tech University Press.
• Dipert, Randall (1995) “Peirce's Underestimated Role in the History of Logic.” In Kenneth Ketner (Ed.) Peirce and Contemporary Thought. New York: Fordham University Press.
• Fisch, Max and Atwell Turquette (1966) “Peirce's Triadic Logic.” Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society 11: 71 - 85.
• Hammer, Eric M. (1998) “Semantics for Existential Graphs.” Journal of Philosophical Logic 27: 489 - 503.
• Herzberger, Hans (1981) “Peirce's Remarkable Theorem.” In L. W. Sumner, J. G. Slater, and F. Wilson (Eds.) Pragmatism and Purpose: Essays Presented to Thomas A. Goudge Toronto: University of Toronto Press.
• Lewis, C. I. (1918) A Survey of Symbolic Logic. Berkeley: University of California Press.
• Maddux, Roger D. (1990) “The Origin of Relation Algebras in the Development and Axiomatization of the Calculus of Relations.” Studia Logica 3: 421 - 55.
• Peirce, Charles S. (1870) “Description of a Notation for the Logic of Relatives, Resulting from an Amplification of the Conceptions of Boole's Calculus of Logic.” Memoirs of the American Academy of Sciences 9: 317 - 78. Reprinted in Peirce (1933).
• Peirce, Charles S. (1883) “Note B: The Logic of Relatives.” In Studies in Logic by Members of the Johns Hopkins University Boston: Little Brown and Co. Reprinted in Peirce (1933).
• Peirce, Charles S. (1885) “On the Algebra of Logic; A Contribution to the Philosophy of Notation.” American Journal of Mathematics 7: 180 - 202. Reprinted in Peirce (1933).
• Peirce, Charles S. (1933) “Collected Papers.” Edited by Charles Hartshorne and Paul Weiss. Cambridge: Harvard University Press. In Edward Moore and Richard Robin (Eds.) Studies in the Philosophy of Charles S. Peirce., Amherst, University of Massachusetts Press.
• Roberts, Don (1964) “The Existential Graphs and Natural Deduction.” In Edward Moore and Richard Robin (Eds.) Studies in the Philosophy of Charles S. Peirce, Amherst, University of Massachusetts Press.
• Roberts, Don (1973) The Existential Graphs of Charles S. Peirce. Mouton and Co.
• Tarski, Alfred (1941) “On the Calculus of Relations.” Journal of Symbolic Logic 6: 73 - 89.
• Zeman, J. Jay (1964) The Graphical Logic of C. S. Peirce. Ph.D. Diss., University of Chicago.

Other Internet Resources

• The MacTutor History of Mathematics Archive, (University of St. Andrew's, Scotland)
• Peirce Edition Project, (Directed by Nathan Houser, Indiana University Purdue University Indianapolis)

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