Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Properties
Citation Information

Table of Contents

Detailed Table of Contents (to the subsection level)

• Introduction
• 1 Distinctions and Terminology
  • 1.1 Properties: Basic Ideas
  • 1.2 Talking about Properties
• 2 Philosophical Explanations: Why Think that Properties Exist?
  • 2.1 Explanation in Ontology
  • 2.2 Constraints on Explanations Employing Properties
  • 2.3 The Fundamental Ontological Tradeoff
• 3 Traditional Explanations: An Unscientific Survey
  • 3.1 Resemblance and Recurrence
  • 3.2 Recognition of New and Novel Instances
  • 3.3 Meaning
  • 3.4 Unification and Triangulation
• 4 What have you done for us Lately? Recent Explanations
  • 4.1 Mathematics
  • 4.2 Semantics and Logical Form
  • 4.3 Naturalistic Ontology
• 5 Existence Conditions
  • 5.1 Minimalism
  • 5.2 Maximalism
  • 5.3 Centrism
  • 5.4 Dual-Entity Accounts
• 6 Identity Conditions
  • 6.1 Necessary Coextension
  • 6.2 Functional Role
  • 6.3 Property Identity in Terms of Encoding
  • 6.4 Ultra-fine Properties
• 7 Kinds of Properties
  • 7.1 First-order vs.Higher-order Properties
  • 7.2 Self-predication and Theories of Types
  • 7.3 Untyped Conceptions of Properties
  • 7.4 Relations
  • 7.5 Fixed-degree vs. Multigrade Properties
  • 7.6 Propositions
  • 7.7 Structured vs. Unstructured Properties
  • 7.8 Instantiation
  • 7.9 Particularizing Properties
  • 7.10 Genus and Species
  • 7.11 Determinables and Determinates
  • 7.12 Natural Kinds
  • 7.13 Purely Qualitative Properties
  • 7.14 Essential Properties and Internal Relations
  • 7.15 Intrinsic vs. Extrinsic Properties
  • 7.16 Primary vs. Secondary Properties
  • 7.17 Supervenient Properties
  • 7.18 Fictional Properties
• 8 Formal Theories of Properties
  • 8.1 A Bare-Bones Logic of Properties
  • 8.2 The Mereology of the Forms?
• 9 Bibliography
• 10 Other Internet Resources
• 11 Related Entries

To Beginning of Entry

More Detailed Table of Contents (to subsubsection level)

• Introduction
• 1 Distinctions and Terminology
  • 1.1 Properties: Basic Ideas
    • Universals and Particulars
    • Properties and Relations
    • Properties can be Instantiated
    • Realism, Nominalism, and Conceptualism
    • The Revival of Properties
    • Properties are as Properties Do
  • 1.2 Talking about Properties
    • Failed Substitutions
    • Predicative Expressions
    • Singular Terms
• 2 Philosophical Explanations: Why Think that Properties Exist?
  • 2.1 Explanation in Ontology
    • The Limits of Explanation
    • Two Views of Explanation in Ontology
  • 2.2 Constraints on Explanations Employing Properties
    • Parochial Constraints
    • More General Constraints
    • Mandatory Constraints
  • 2.3 The Fundamental Ontological Tradeoff
• 3 Traditional Explanations: An Unscientific Survey
  • 3.1 Resemblance and Recurrence
  • 3.2 Recognition of New and Novel Instances
  • 3.3 Meaning
  • 3.4 Unification and Triangulation
    • Explanation by Unification
• 4 What have you done for us Lately? Recent Explanations
  • 4.1 Mathematics
    • Explananda in Philosophy of Mathematics
    • Sample Explanations
    • Beating the Competition
    • Difficulties
    • The Problem of Isomorphic Identifications
    • The Problem of Epistemic Access
    • Excursus: Other Reductions
    • Lessons About Properties
  • 4.2 Semantics and Logical Form
    • Explananda in Semantics
    • Sample Explanations
    • Beating the Competition
    • Difficulties
    • Lessons about Properties
  • 4.3 Naturalistic Ontology
    • Scientific Realism
    • Measurement
    • Causal Powers
    • Laws of Nature
    • N-relation Theories
    • The Background: N-Relation Theories vs. Regularity Theories
    • N-relation Theories: Sample Explanations
    • Properties, Powers and Laws
    • Lessons About Properties
• 5 Existence Conditions
  • 5.1 Minimalism
  • 5.2 Maximalism
  • 5.3 Centrism
  • 5.4 Dual-Entity Accounts
    • Summary
• 6 Identity Conditions
  • 6.1 Necessary Coextension
  • 6.2 Functional Role
  • 6.3 Property Identity in Terms of Encoding
  • 6.4 Ultra-fine Properties
• 7 Kinds of Properties
  • 7.1 First-order vs.Higher-order Properties
  • 7.2 Self-predication and Theories of Types
  • 7.3 Untyped Conceptions of Properties
  • 7.4 Relations
  • 7.5 Fixed-degree vs. Multigrade Properties
  • 7.6 Propositions
  • 7.7 Structured vs. Unstructured Properties
  • 7.8 Instantiation
  • 7.9 Particularizing Properties
    • Characterizing Properties
    • Mass Properties
  • 7.10 Genus and Species
  • 7.11 Determinables and Determinates
  • 7.12 Natural Kinds
  • 7.13 Purely Qualitative Properties
  • 7.14 Essential Properties and Internal Relations
  • 7.15 Intrinsic vs. Extrinsic Properties
  • 7.16 Primary vs. Secondary Properties
  • 7.17 Supervenient Properties
  • 7.18 Fictional Properties
• 8 Formal Theories of Properties
  • 8.1 A Bare-Bones Logic of Properties
    • Untyped Variants
    • Complex Terms and "Compound" Properties
    • Logic and the Empirical Conception of Properties
    • The Status of Formal Theories
    • Future Directions
  • 8.2 The Mereology of the Forms?
    • Structured Specifications vs. Specifications of Structure
• 9 Bibliography
• 10 Other Internet Resources
• 11 Related Entries

To Beginning of Entry

Table of Contents to Properties
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy