This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
For ease of reference, the technical definitions discussed in earlier sections are collected in this section. ‘A’ and ‘B’ should be understood as variables ranging over non-empty sets of properties (though the quantification is typically implicit).
Individual Supervenience
- Weak Individual Supervenience
- Possible-Worlds Formulation: A weakly supervenes on B iff for any possible world w and any individuals x and y in w, if x and y are B-indiscernible in w, then they are A-indiscernible in w.
Modal Operator Formulation: A weakly supervenes on B iff necessarily, if anything x has some property F in A, then there is at least one property G in B such that x has G, and everything that has G has F.
∀x∀F∈A[Fx → ∃G∈B(Gx & ∀y(Gy→Fy))]
- Strong Individual Supervenience
- Possible-Worlds Formulation: A strongly supervenes on B iff for any possible worlds w1 and w2 and any individuals x in w1 and y in w2, if x in w1 is B-indiscernible from y in w2, then x in w1 is A-indiscernible from y in w2.
Modal Operator Formulation: A strongly supervenes on B iff necessarily, if anything x has some property F in A, then there is at least one property G in B such x has G, and necessarily everything that has G has F.
∀x∀F∈A[Fx → ∃G∈B(Gx &
∀y(Gy→Fy))]
Strong: A strong-regionally supervenes on B iff for any possible worlds w1 and w2 and any space-time regions r1 in w1 and spacetime region r2 in w2, if r1 in w1 is exactly like r2 in w2 in every intrinsic B-respect, then r1 in w1 is exactly like r2 in w2 in every intrinsic A-respect.
Strong Similarity-Based: A strongly supervenes on B iff for any worlds w1 and w2, and for any x in w1 and y in w2, if x in w1 is not largely different from y in w2 with respect to B-properties, then x in w1 is not largely different from y in w2 with respect to A-properties.
Weak Global: A weakly globally supervenes on B iff for any worlds w1 and w2, if there is a B-preserving isomorphism between w1 and w2, then there is an A-preserving isomorphism between them.
Intermediate Global: A intermediately globally supervenes on B iff for any worlds w1 and w2, if there is a B-preserving isomorphism between w1 and w2, then there is an A-and-B-preserving isomorphism between w1 and w2.
Strong Global: A strongly globally supervenes on B iff for any worlds w1 and w2, every B-preserving isomorphism between w1 and w2 is an A-preserving isomorphism between them.
Strong Multiple Domain: A strongly supervenes on B relative to relation R just in case for any worlds w1 and w2, any x in w1 and y in w2, if R|x in w1 is B-indiscernible from R|y in w2, x in w1 is A-indiscernible from y in w2.
Weak Coincident-Friendly: For any world w and any x and y in w, if x in w is B-discernible from y in w, then for each thing x* in w to which x is R-related, there is something y* in w to which y is R-related, and which is A-indiscernible from x*.
Strong Coincident-Friendly: For all x and y, and all worlds w1 and w2, if x in w1 is B-indiscernible from y in w2, then for each thing x* in w1 to which x is R-related, there is something y* in w2 to which y is R-related, and which is A-indiscernible from x*.
Brian McLaughlin brianmc@rci.rutgers.edu | Karen Bennett kbennett@Princeton.EDU |