Notes to Anthony Collins

1. For an excellent brief account of these men and others, see the article "Deism" by Ernest Campbell Mossner in the MacMillan Encyclopedia of Philosophy, Vol. 2 Pp. 326-335.

2. Clarke holds a version of what John Cottingham has called an "heirloom theory of causality" since the theory requires that the effect ‘inherit’ some property from its cause. There are a variety of different versions of this kind of theory, some more reductionist than others. Clarke holds a strongly reductionist version. Collins, by contrast, holds that causes and effects need have nothing in common. In this respect he is a precursor of Hume.