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Qualia: The Knowledge Argument

First published Tue 3 Sep, 2002

The knowledge argument aims to establish that conscious experience involves non-physical properties. It rests on the idea that someone who has complete physical knowledge about another conscious being might yet lack knowledge about how it feels to have the experiences of that being. It is one of the most discussed arguments against physicalism.

1. Historical Remarks

In the context of his explanation of the difference between mechanistic and emergentist theories, C.D. Broad (1925) argues that even if the mechanistic theory of chemistry were true there still would be a property of ammonia that a mathematical archangel endowed with unlimited mathematical skills and “gifted with the further power of perceiving the microscopic structure of atoms” could not predict, namely its smell:

He [the archangel] would know exactly what the microscopic structure of ammonia must be; but he would be totally unable to predict that a substance with this structure must smell as ammonia does when it gets into the human nose. The utmost that he could predict on this subject would be that certain changes would take place in the mucous membrane, the olfactory nerves and so on. But he could not possibly know that theses changes would be accompanied by the appearance of a smell in general or of the peculiar smell of ammonia in particular, unless someone told him so or he had smelled it for himself. (Broad, 1925, p. 71)

Under the title “The Cognitive Role of Acquaintance,” H. Feigl (1958) briefly discusses the epistemic limitations of a Martian who studies human behavior but does not share human sentiments:

The first question I wish to discuss concerns the cognitive ‘plus’, i.e., the alleged advantages of knowledge by acquaintance over knowledge by description. We may ask, for example, what does the seeing person know that the congenitally blind person could not know. Or, to take two examples from Eddington, what could a someone know about the effects of jokes if he had no sense of humor? Could a Martian, entirely without sentiments of compassion and piety, know about what is going on during a commemoration of the armistice? For the sake of argument, we assume compete physical (1 or 2) predictability and explainability of the behavior of humans equipped with vision, a sense of humor, and sentiments of piety. The Martian could then predict all responses, including the linguistic utterances of the earthlings in the situations which involve their visual perceptions, their laughter about jokes, or their (solemn) behavior at the commemoration. But ex hypothesi, the Martian would be lacking completely in the sort of imagery and empathy which depends on familiarity (direct acquaintance) with the kinds of qualia to be imaged or empathized. (Feigl, 1958, p. 431)

T. Nagel (1974) argues that some facts can only be captured ‘from a subjective perspective’ and uses his famous example of bats to illustrate the point: Even if we knew everything there is to know ‘from an objective perspective’ about a bat's sonar system, certain factual questions concerning bats would remain unanswered. We still would not know ‘what it is like’ to perceive a given object with a bat's sonar system.

As these examples suggest, the idea that complete physical knowledge isn't sufficient for complete knowledge of phenomenal states has been around for a while. In many of these cases, the idea is not used to argue directly against physicalism, although such a use is arguably present in Broad (1925). The current debate was initiated by Jackson (1982) who used the idea to develop a more explicit anti-physicalist argument, the knowledge argument.

2. The Basic Idea

Frank Jackson (1982) formulates the intuition underlying his Knowledge Argument in a much cited passage using his famous example of the neurophysiologist Mary:

Mary is a brilliant scientist who is, for whatever reason, forced to investigate the world from a black and white room via a black and white television monitor. She specializes in the neurophysiology of vision and acquires, let us suppose, all the physical information there is to obtain about what goes on when we see ripe tomatoes, or the sky, and use terms like ‘red’, ‘blue’, and so on. She discovers, for example, just which wavelength combinations from the sky stimulate the retina, and exactly how this produces via the central nervous system the contraction of the vocal chords and expulsion of air from the lungs that results in the uttering of the sentence ‘The sky is blue’. (…) What will happen when Mary is released from her black and white room or is given a color television monitor? Will she learn anything or not? It seems just obvious that she will learn something about the world and our visual experience of it. But then is it inescapable that her previous knowledge was incomplete. But she had all the physical information. Ergo there is more to have than that, and Physicalism is false.

The argument contained in this passage may be put like this:

(1) Mary has all the physical information concerning human color vision before her release.

(2) But there is some information about human color vision that she does not have before her release.

Therefore

(3) Not all information is physical information.

Most authors who discuss the knowledge argument cite the case of Mary, but Frank Jackson used a further example in his seminal article: the case of a person, Fred, who sees a color unknown to normal human perceivers. We might want to know what color Fred experiences when looking at things that appear to him in that particular way. It seems clear that no amount of knowledge about what happens in his brain and about how color information is processed in his visual system will help us to find an answer to that question. In both cases cited by Jackson, an epistemic subject A appears to have no access to particular items of knowledge about a subject B: A cannot know that B has an experience of a particular quality Q on certain occasions. This particular item of knowledge about B is inaccessible to A because A never had experiences of Q herself.

3. Some Clarifications

3.1 Two Versions of the Argument

As Horgan (1984) points out, talk of ‘physical information’ in the context of the knowledge argument is ambiguous between an epistemological and an ontological reading. “Physical information” may be interpreted (a) in the sense of what Horgan calls ‘explicit physical information’ (according to Horgan's proposal a sentence S expresses explicit physical information about certain processes just in case S belongs to, or follows from, a theoretically adequate physical account of those processes) or (b) in the sense of ‘ontologically physical information’ which is explicated in Horgan, 1984, p. 150 as follows: a sentence S “expresses ontologically physical information about certain processes just in case (i) all entities referred to or quantified over in S are physical entities, and (ii) all the properties and relations expressed by the predicates in S are physical properties and relations.” Presupposing a distinction along these lines one may replace ‘to have all explicit physical information about x’ by ‘to have complete physical knowledge about x’ and one may replace ‘to have all ontologically physical information about x’ by ‘to know all the physical facts about x’. The argument may thus be reformulated in two different ways:

(V1) The weaker version of the knowledge argument:

(1a) Mary has complete physical knowledge concerning facts about human color vision before her release.

(2a) But there is some kind of knowledge concerning facts about human color vision that she does not have before her release.

Therefore

(3a) There is some kind of knowledge concerning facts about human color vision that is non-physical knowledge.

(V2) The stronger version of the knowledge argument:

(1b) Mary knows all the physical facts concerning human color vision before her release.

(2b) But there are some facts about human color vision that Mary does not know before her release.

Therefore

(3b) There are non-physical facts concerning human color vision.

The conclusion of the stronger version of the argument (3b) is an ontological claim that the physicalist must reject. The conclusion of the weaker version of the argument is merely an epistemological claim that is compatible with denying the existence of non-physical facts. Although Jackson's original formulation in terms of information is open to both interpretations it is clear that the second stronger version is what he had in mind.

As many have pointed out, the result of the weaker version (3a) does not imply the result of the stronger version (3b). That a person has incomplete knowledge about a certain topic does not imply without further assumptions that there is some specific fact she does not have knowledge of. The example of knowledge about oneself (de se knowledge) may illustrate the general point. Let us suppose that John, who is at t in Amsterdam, does not know that he is now in Amsterdam (if asked about his present location he would assert “I am now in Venice”). John's knowledge concerning the present location of people is incomplete. He lacks a specific locating piece of de se knowledge. Still, there need not be any fact concerning the location of people that John does not have knowledge of. It does not follow from the description of the case that John does not have knowledge of the fact that John is in Amsterdam. John may well know that John is in Amsterdam but, having forgotten that he is himself John, he may fail to conclude that he is now in Amsterdam. If John finally learns that he is in Amsterdam, he does not thereby learn a new fact—or so many philosophers would insist—he gains new knowledge of a fact that he already knew in a different way.

If—in analogy to the de se case—some physical facts about color vision can be known in two different ways,—in a ‘physical way’ (under ‘physical concepts’) and in some other, non-physical way (under ‘non-physical concepts’), then it is possible to acquire new (non-physical) knowledge about a (physical) fact without thereby acquiring knowledge of a new fact (the very same fact may have been known before under its physical conceptualization). Many authors accept the weaker version of the argument but reject the stronger one for the reason just sketched: they admit that Mary gains new propositional knowledge but deny that she thereby comes to know facts that she did not know before in some other way. (These authors accept the first premise of both versions of the argument and the second premise of the first version as well, but they deny the second premise of the second version and insist that (2a) does not imply (2b)). Their position with respect to the knowledge argument will be called the New Knowledge/Old Fact-View (see Section 4.6 below). Others deny even the weaker version V1 and claim that Mary does not gain any new propositional knowledge (no new knowledge about something that is the case, no factual knowledge). Their position will be called the No Propositional Knowledge View (see Sections 4.3 and 4.5 below).

To locate the different points of disagreement it is helpful to formulate the stronger version of the argument more explicitly.

(V3) Explicit formulation of the knowledge argument (stronger version) :
Premise P1 Mary has complete physical knowledge about human color vision before her release.

Therefore
Consequence C1 Mary knows all the physical facts about human color vision before her release.
Premise P2 There is some (kind of) knowledge concerning facts about human color vision that Mary does not have before her release.

Therefore (from (P2)):
Consequence C2 There are some facts about human color vision that Mary does not know before her release.

Therefore (from (C1) and (C2)):
Consequence C3 There are non-physical facts about human color vision.

Once C1 and C2 are accepted, there is obviously no way to avoid C3 (which follows logically from the former two). Moreover, is seems hard to deny that it is in principle possible to have complete physical knowledge about human color vision (or about an appropriately chosen part thereof). If so, premise P1 should be accepted as an appropriate description of a legitimate thought experiment. To avoid the antimaterialist conclusion C3 the physicalist can (a) object against the inference from P1 to C1 (a minority of philosophers have chosen this strategy, see Section 4.2 below) or he or she can avoid C2 by (b) denying premise P2 (this is the strategy chosen by proponents of the No Propositional Knowledge View, see Sections 4.3 and 4.5 below) or by (c) blocking the inference from premise P2 to C2 (this is the strategy chosen by a majority of physicalist philosophers who subscribe to some version of the New Knowledge/Old Fact View, see Section 4.6 below).

3.2 Physical and Non-physical

The knowledge argument is often cited as one of those anti-physicalist qualia-based arguments that are supposed to justify property dualism. The above formulation, however, does not explicitly mention non-physical properties but only non-physical facts. But the relation between the two claims is obvious. Friends of the knowledge argument will say that the facts at issue are non-physical because they involve the exemplification of non-physical properties (e.g. of the property of having an experience with quality Q).

In the assumption that Mary has all physical knowledge (first version) or knows all the physical facts (second version) “physical” is meant in a very broad sense that includes knowledge about (or facts concerning) the functioning of the receptors and neurons involved in color vision (biological and physiological knowledge/facts) as well as knowledge about (or facts concerning) the whole network of causal relations between processes underlying color vision, external stimuli and behavior (functional knowledge/ functional facts). “Physical” knowledge in the broad sense at issue even includes psychological knowledge (e.g. knowledge about the result of psychophysical experiments) in so far as they can be formulated without use of phenomenal terminology. One might try to explicate “physical knowledge” in the sense at issue in roughly the following way: physical knowledge includes all knowledge that is expressible in a terminology that does not contain irreducibly mental terms. It would be natural to define physical facts as those facts that can be expressed in this way. But note that this definition of ‘physical facts’ begs the question against an objection that has been raised against the knowledge argument (see Section 4.2 below). It is certainly not easy to formulate a precise, adequate and non question-begging account of “physical knowledge” and “physical facts” suited for the discussion of the knowledge argument. It is, however, quite common to assume that our intuitive understanding of “physical knowledge” in the broad sense at issue is clear enough for the purposes of the debate, though some argue that talk of “physical facts” needs clarification (see Alter (1998)).

3.3 Knowing what it is like

It is common to formulate Mary's new knowledge in terms of Thomas Nagel's famous locution of knowing what it's like: Mary does not know (while living in her black-and-white environment) what it is like to see colors and she learns what it is like to see colors only after her release. But this common way to put the point may lead to a confusion of (a) mere acquaintance with kinds of color experiences by having and remembering them and (b) knowledge about what kind of color experience other subjects have at a given occasion, and it may thereby lead to a failure to distinguish two steps of epistemic progress that Jackson's Mary takes at once. To see the two steps involved one may consider an example used in Nida-Rümelin (1996) and (1998): Like Mary, Marianna first (at t1) lives in a black and white environment. Contrary to Mary (at a later moment t2) she gets acquainted with colors by seeing arbitrarily colored objects (abstract paintings, red chairs, blue tables, etc. but no yellow bananas, no pictures of landscapes with a blue sky etc.). Marianna is therefore unable to relate the kinds of color experiences she now is acquainted with to what she already knew about them at t1. At t2, Marianna may wonder which of four slides (a red, a blue, a green and a yellow slide) appears to her in the color normal people experience when looking at the cloudless sky. At t2 Marianna knows, in a sense, what it is like to have experiences of red, blue, etc. But she still lacks the relevant items of knowledge about what other people experience: there is a clear sense in which she still may not know that the sky appears blue to normal perceivers, she may even have the false believe that it appears to normal perceivers like the red slide appears to her and thus believe, in a sense, that the sky appears red to normal perceivers. Only at t3, when Marianna is finally released and sees the sky, does she gain this item of knowledge. One way to describe the two steps of epistemic progress is this: At t2, by having color experiences, Marianna can form new concepts, she now has what has been called ‘phenomenal concepts’ of kinds of color experiences. By acquiring these concepts she acquires the capacity to ask new questions, and to form new (eventually false) hypotheses (e.g. about the appearance of the sky to normal perceivers). Only at t3 does she acquire the kind of knowledge that the knowledge argument is concerned with (knowledge that involves the application of phenomenal concepts) about experiences of other people.

Once these two steps are clearly distinguished one may conclude that Marianna's relevant epistemic progress at t3 (and Mary's relevant progress after release) is not happily described by talk of knowing what it's like. Rather, or so one may argue, Mary and Marianna acquire a particular kind of belief that the sky appears blue to normal perceivers, namely the phenomenal belief that it appears blue to normal perceivers, where phenomenal belief involves the application of the appropriate phenomenal concept. Both may have believed, in a sense (the non-phenomenal sense that does not require use of phenomenal concepts) that the sky appears blue to normal perceivers while still in their black-and-white environment (they may have been told so by their friends). (For the distinction between phenomenal and non-phenomenal belief see Nida-Rumelin 1996 and 1998).

4. Objections

4.1 Doubts about the Thought Experiment

Some authors have raised doubts about the thought experiment itself. It is sometimes pointed out, for example, that merely confining Mary to a monochromatic environment would not prevent her from having color experiences (see Thompson (1995), p. 264) or that, after release, she would not be able to see colors. But the example can be refined to meet these objections. Mary might be monochromatic from birth and changed into a normal perceiver by some medical procedure. It is sometimes objected that already accepted or future results of visual science are or might be incompatible with the existence of a Mary-case (a person with monochromatic experience who becomes a normal color perceiver later) or that such results might require (to preserve consistence with visual science) the introduction of so many additional assumptions that the conceivability of the example becomes doubtful. To this one might reply that the thought experiment need not be compatible with visual science. If the case of a person with monochromatic vision who turns into a normal perceiver really does involve serious difficulties for materialism, then the mere fact (if it were one) that our visual apparatus excludes the actual existence of such a case does not seem to provide a convincing reply for the materialist. But this point (the relevance or irrelevance of visual science in this context) has not received much discussion in the literature. It has, however, been pointed out (see Graham and Horgan, 2000, footnote 4 with its reference to Shepard (1993)) that at least presently available results of color vision science do not exclude a Mary-case. (The psychologist Knut Nordby is a real life case of a color vision specialist who is also a complete achromat. See his paper ‘Vision in a Complete Achromat: A Personal Account’, linked into in the Other Internet Resources section.)

Another doubt about the thought experiment is raised by the claim that a person who is confined to a monochromatic environment but knows everything physical there is to know about visual color experience would be able to figure out what colored things look like and thus would e.g. be able to imagine the kind of color experience produced in normal perceivers when looking at the cloudless sky during the day (see e.g. Dennett (1991), Churchland (1989) and Maloney (1985) p. 36). Probably the most common reaction to this is simply to doubt the claim. But it is not clear that the claim, if correct, would undermine the knowledge argument. The opponent would have to show that complete physical knowledge necessarily involves the capacity to imagine blue. One may doubt that this claim is compatible with the widely accepted assumption that physical knowledge can be acquired independently of one's particular perceptual apparatus. (Arguably a subject whose visual apparatus is not suited for visual experiences at all will not be able to develop the capacity to imagine colors on the basis of physical knowledge alone, even if this were true for Mary).

Some have argued that Mary would recognize the colors when first seeing them on the basis of her complete physical knowledge about color vision (see Hardin (1992)). According to this claim she would think something like “oh, so this is red” when first confronted with a red patch and she could not be fooled by what Dennett calls ‘the blue banana trick&$146;: when shown a blue banana she would know that it has the wrong color (see Dennett (1991)). A possible and common response is to simply doubt these claims. But, in any case, it is not clear that these claims undermine the knowledge argument. One may respond along the following lines: If Mary when first confronted with red were able to conclude that she is now seeing what people call red, she thereby acquires a large set of new beliefs about red experiences (that they are produced by roses, such-and-such wavelength combinations and so on). On the basis of seeing red she (a) acquires a new phenomenal concept of red and (b) she forms new beliefs involving that new concept using her previously acquired physical knowledge. But if this description is correct, then her previous knowledge was incomplete (for a detailed discussion of Dennett's argument involving the blue banana trick see Dale (1995)).

4.2 Complete Physical Knowledge without Knowledge of all the Physical Facts

It may appear obvious that premise P1 (Mary has complete physical knowledge about human color vision) implies C1 (Mary knows all the physical facts about human color vision). If all physical facts can be known under some physical conceptualization, then a person who has complete physical knowledge about a topic knows all the relevant physical facts. But a few philosophers can be understood as objecting against precisely this apparently unproblematic step. Harman (1990) argues that Mary does not know all the functional facts concerning human color vision because she lacks the concept of what it is for an object to be red, blue, etc. Flanagan (1992) distinguishes metaphysical physicalism from linguistic physicalism. While metaphysical physicalism is the ontological claim that there are no non-physical individuals, properties or relations and no non-physical facts, linguistic physicalism says that “everything physical can be expressed or captured in the languages of the physical sciences.” According to Flanagan Mary's case may refute linguistic physicalism but does not refute metaphysical physicalism. Alter (1998) points out that the knowledge argument needs the premise that all physical facts can be learned discursively and argues that this assumption has not been established. It may be argued against this view that it becomes hard to understand what it is for a property or a fact to be physical once we drop the assumption that physical properties and physical facts are just those properties and facts that can be expressed in physical terminology.

4.3 No Propositional Knowledge 1: the Ability Hypothesis

Two different versions of the No Propositional Knowledge-View have been proposed. According to the Ability Hypothesis (most prominently defended in Lewis (1983) and (1988) and in Nemirow (1980) and (1990)), Mary does not acquire any new propositional knowledge after release (no knowledge about something that is the case, no factual knowledge), but only a bundle of abilities (like the ability to imagine, remember and recognize colors or color experiences). According to the Acquaintance Hypothesis proposed by Conee (1994), Mary's new knowledge after release is what he calls “acquaintance knowledge” which is neither propositional knowledge nor identical to a bundle of abilities.

Lewis and Nemirow presuppose that Mary's epistemic progress after release consists in the acquisition of knowing what it is like (e.g. to have an experience of blue) and they both claim that knowing what it is like is to have certain practical abilities. According to Nemirow “knowing what an experience is like is the same as knowing how to imagine having the experience” (Nemirow (1990), p. 495). According to Lewis,

…knowing what it is like is the possession of abilities: abilities to recognize, abilities to imagine, abilities to predict one's behavior by imaginative experiments. (Lewis (1983), p. 131).
A few years later he writes:
The Ability Hypothesis says that knowing what an experience is like just is the possession of these abilities to remember, imagine, and recognize. … It isn't knowing-that. It's knowing-how. (Lewis (1990), p. 516)

Lewis's main argument for the Ability Hypothesis can be summarized like this. (1) The only alternative to the Ability Hypothesis is what he calls the Hypothesis of Phenomenal Information (HPI). (According to the HPI knowing what it is like is propositional in the following sense: coming to know what it is like involves the elimination of hitherto open possibilities). (2) The HPI is incompatible with physicalism. (3) The Ability Hypothesis is compatible with physicalism and explains everything that may be explained by the HPI. Therefore: The Ability Hypothesis should be preferred.

Note that the Ability Hypothesis is compatible with the view that we do sometimes acquire propositional knowledge on the basis of getting acquainted with a new kind of experience from the first person perspective. The following remarks by Levin are hard to deny:

…it would be perverse to claim that bare experience can provide us only with practical abilities…. By being shown an unfamiliar color, I acquire information about its similarities and compatibilities with other colors, and its effects on other mental states: surely I seem to be acquiring certain facts about color and the visual experience of it. (Levin (1986), p.246)

But, as pointed out by Tye (forthcoming), this does not undermine the Ability Hypothesis. The Ability hypothesis implies that there is some knowledge that can only be acquired by having experiences of a particular kind and that this knowledge is nothing but knowing-how. This of course does not exclude that there also is propositional knowledge that can be acquired by getting acquainted with kinds of experiences from the first person perspective. The proponent of the Ability Hypothesis only has to insist that, if there is such propositional knowledge, then it need not be acquired on that particular basis but is accessible in other ways as well.

4.4 Objections Against the Ability Hypothesis

It has been argued against Nemirow that the ability to imagine having an experience of a particular kind is neither necessary nor sufficient for knowing what it is like to have that kind of experience. To show that imaginative abilities are not necessary for knowing what it is like, Conee (1994) and Alter (1998) cite the example of a person who has no capacity to imagine having color experiences. They claim that despite this defect she would know what it is like to have an experience of e.g. green while attentively staring at something that looks green to her. To show that imaginative abilities are not sufficient for knowing what it is like Conee introduces the following example: A person, Martha, “who is highly skilled at visualizing an intermediate shade that she has not experienced between pairs of shades that she has experienced…happens not to have any familiarity with the shade known as cherry red.” Martha is told that cherry red is midway between burgundy red and fire red (she has experienced the latter two shades of red). Given this information and her extraordinary capacity, Martha has the ability to imagine cherry red, but as long as she does not exercise this ability she does not know what it is like to see cherry red. (A similar example is used for the same purpose and discussed in more detail by Raymont (1999)). Raymont (1999) argues that mnemic, recognitional and imaginative abilities neither separately nor conjointly amount to knowing of what it is like to have a particular kind of experience. He first argues that none of these abilities is necessary and sufficient for knowing what it is like: (a) Mnemic abilities are not necessary, since someone can learn what an experience is like when first having it without already remembering an experience of the relevant kind. (b) Imaginative abilities are not sufficient since someone can have the ability to imagine a particular kind of experience without exercising it (see the example cited above). (c) To show that recognitional abilities are not sufficient either, Raymont cites empirical data “in support of the view that one can have the ability to noninferentially recognize a certain type of visual experience without ever having had it, and thus without knowing what it is like to have it”. But then these three kinds of abilities cannot conjointly amount to knowing what it is like either: if they did, then—contrary to (a)—each of them would have to be a necessary condition for knowing what it is like.

Gertler (1999) argues that the best candidate for an analysis in the spirit of the Ability Hypothesis is to identify knowing what it is like to have an experience of red with the ability to recognize seeing-red experiences by their phenomenal quality and then goes on to attack this candidate: she points out that the ability to recognize seeing-red experiences by their phenomenal quality can be explained by the fact that I know what it is like to see red but not vice versa.

Michael Tye (forthcoming) concedes that none of the abilities considered by Lewis is necessary for knowing what it is like and he discusses the following possible revision of the Ability Hypothesis: knowing what it is like to have an experience of red is the ability to apply an indexical concept to an experience of red (while having it) via introspection. But, he goes on to argue, this revised version can again be rejected by a counterexample that shows that the ability at issue is not sufficient for knowing what it is like: If Mary is distracted and does not attend to her experience when she first sees a red object, then she need not apply any concept to her experience at all. In this case, she still does not know what it is like to have red experiences although she has the ability to apply an indexical concept to her present experience (she has the ability, but, being distracted, she does not exercise it). Tye concedes that the revised version of the Ability Hypothesis could not, anyway, be used against the knowledge argument in the way that was originally intended. The reason is that the revised version is compatible with the view that Mary does acquire knowing-that if she is not distracted when first seeing something red: she learns that this is a red experience (where “this” refers introspectively to her present experience) and so acquires knowing-that. According to Tye to have indexical knowledge of this kind is sufficient but not necessary for knowing what it is like to have a red experience. After all, it is impossible to introspectively refer to a red experience without presently having that kind of experience, but Tye wishes to concede that a person can know what it is like to have a red experience while not presently having a red experience. This reasoning motivates his disjunctive account of knowing what it is like: “S knows what it is like to undergo experience E iff either S now has indexical knowledge-that with respect to E obtained via current introspection or S has the Lewis abilities with respect to E.” (Tye (forthcoming), p.*) Tye thus defends the physicalist view against the knowledge argument by a combination of the two strategies mentioned above: he applies the New Knowledge/Old Fact-strategy to the person who knows what it is like to have an experience in the sense of the first conjunct (the indexical thought at issue is made true by a physical fact) and he applies the No Propositional Knowledge-strategy to the case of someone who has knowing what it is like in the sense of the second disjunct.

Lycan (1996) argues against the Ability Hypothesis and for the view that Mary acquires new knowledge-that after release by claiming that “S knows what it is like to see blue” means something like “S knows that it is like Q to see blue” where Q names the phenomenal quality at issue. It has been objected by Tye (*) that the use of the qualia name “Q” within a propositional attitude context creates the well-known problems: Replacing “Q” by another name “R” for the same quale may change the truth value of the belief ascription (Tye (*), p.*). A proponent of Lycan's view could however respond along the following lines: In the case of qualia names within belief contexts it does not matter which name is used to refer to the quale at issue as long as the belief is meant in the sense of a phenomenal belief ascription. “S believes that it is like Q to see blue” means, on the phenomenal reading, that S has the relevant belief about Q under a phenomenal concept of Q. Under the assumption that it is impossible to have two different phenomenal concepts of one and the same quale, the objection is met: As long as two qualia names Q and R refer to the same quale, replacing Q by R in an ascription of phenomenal belief cannot change the truth value of the belief ascription.

4.5 No Propositional Knowledge 2: The Acquaintance Hypothesis

Earl Conee (1994) proposes another variant of the No Propositional Knowledge-View. According to Conee acquaintance constitutes a third category of knowledge that is neither reducible to factual knowledge nor to knowing-how and he argues that Mary acquires after release only acquaintance knowledge. According to Conee knowing something by acquaintance “requires the person to be familiar with the known entity in the most direct way that it is possible for a person to be aware of that thing” (Conee (1994), p. 144). Since “experiencing a quality is the most direct way to apprehend a quality” (Conee (1994), p. 144), Mary gains acquaintance with color qualia only after release. According to the view proposed by Conee the physicalist can defend himself against the knowledge argument in the following way: (1) Qualia are physical properties of experiences (and experiences are physical processes). Let Q be such a property. (2) Mary can know all about Q and she can know that a given experience has Q before release, although—before release—she is not acquainted with Q. (3) After release Mary gets acquainted with Q, but she does not acquire any new item of propositional knowledge by getting acquainted with Q (in particular she already knew under what conditions normal perceivers have experiences with the property Q).

A friend of the knowledge argument might concede that a person is acquainted with Q only if she has or had an experience with property Q but he would have to insist that being acquainted with Q in that sense is a necessary condition for being able to know (in the relevant sense) that an experience has Q. Another kind of criticism of the Acquaintance Hypothesis is developed in Gertler (1999). She argues that the property dualist can explain why the most direct way to get familiar with a quale is by having an experience of the relevant kind while the physicalist does not have any explanation for this particular feature of qualia.

It is interesting to see that a proposal clearly falling into the category “New Knowledge/Old Fact View” is very similar in spirit to the Acquaintance Hypothesis: Bigelow and Pargetter (1990) argue that Mary's progress after release consists in the fact that she now stands in a new acquaintance relation to color qualia, but their theory about the individuation of beliefs implies that she thereby acquires new factual knowledge. Different beliefs, according to Bigelow and Pargetter, can be distinguished appropriately only if one takes into consideration the way the subject is acquainted with the individuals and properties her belief is about (they use the technical term “modes of acquaintance” in that context).

4.6 The New Knowledge/Old Fact View

Several positive arguments for the view that Mary's new knowledge after release constitutes propositional knowledge (genuine information) have been formulated in the literature. Lycan argues, for example, that Mary's new knowledge goes along with the elimination of epistemic possibilities and that her new abilities are best explained by her having new information (for further arguments see Lycan (1996), pp. 92). Loar (1990) points out that the embedded occurrence of “feels like such and such” in sentences like “if pains feel like such and such then Q” cannot be accounted for in a model that treats knowing of what it is like as mere know-how. McConnell (1994) defends the more radical view that the acquisition of knowing-how is normally accompanied by the acquisition of a particular new item of knowing-that.

Many philosophers find it hard to deny that Mary gains new factual knowledge after release and for that reason (if they are physicalists) feel attracted by the New Knowledge/Old Fact View. Positions that clearly fall into that category are defended in Horgan (1984), Churchland (1985), Tye (1986) and (1995), Bigelow and Pargetter (1990), Loar (1990), Lycan (1990) and (1995), Pereboom (1994) and Perry (2001).

The basic ideas common to the New Knowledge/Old Fact View may be summarized as follows:

(1) Phenomenal character, e.g. phenomenal blueness, is a physical property of experiences (but see Lycan (1990) for an exception who construes qualia as properties of external objects).

(2) To gain knowledge of what it is like to have an experience of a particular phenomenal character requires the acquisition of phenomenal concepts of phenomenal character.

(3) What it is for an organism to acquire and possess a phenomenal concept can be fully described in broadly physical terms.

(4) A subject can acquire and possess phenomenal concepts only if it has or has had experiences of the relevant phenomenal kind.

(5) After release Mary gains knowledge about phenomenal characters under phenomenal concepts.

But the facts that make these new items of knowledge true are physical facts that Mary knew before release under another conceptualization.

The differences between variants of the New Knowledge/Old Fact View concern the theoretical (physicalist) account of (a) phenomenal character, (b) phenomenal concepts of phenomenal characters and (c) the relation between phenomenal characters and the corresponding phenomenal concepts. All proponents of the view point out that, according to their proposal, physical concepts and phenomenal concepts are cognitively independent: it is impossible to see a priori that something that falls under a physical concept of a particular phenomenal character also falls under the corresponding phenomenal concept of that phenomenal character. This is why it is possible to have (like Mary) complete physical knowledge about e.g. phenomenal blueness (you know everything there is to know about phenomenal blueness under its physical conceptualization) without having a phenomenal concept of blueness and without knowing any of these facts under a phenomenal concept of blueness.

In general, if a philosopher A claims that the argument of philosopher B does not go through, it is a point in favor of his view if he can provide an error theory, that is if he can explain why the argument may appear correct in the first place. The New Knowledge/Old Fact View can claim to have an error theory with respect to the knowledge argument. Given the cognitive independence of physical and phenomenal concepts of blueness it appears as if we could imagine a situation where everything Mary knew before release were fulfilled but not what she came to know after release (and this can be taken to imply that she does come to know new facts). But, according to the New Knowledge/Old Fact View this is an illusion. There is no such possible situation. What Mary learns after release is made true by a physical fact that she already knew before her release. Some versions of the New Knowledge/Old Fact-View will be briefly described in what follows.

4.7 Variants of the New Knowledge/Old Fact View

Horgan (1984) does not provide a developed theoretical account of phenomenal concepts but is one of the first to formulate the basic intuition shared by most or all proponents of the New Knowledge/Old Fact View: By having experiences of blue, Mary gets acquainted with phenomenal blueness (which is in fact a physical property of experiences) “from the experiential perspective,” she gains what he calls “the first person ostensive perspective on that property” (Horgan, 1984, p. 151): she now can refer to phenomenal blueness by thinking or saying “that kind of property” while having, remembering or imagining a blue experience and while attending to its particular quality. She thus has acquired a new concept of phenomenal blueness. Using this new concept she can form new beliefs (and acquire new knowledge) about phenomenal blueness. Formulated in this way, the view may appear similar to Conee's acquaintance account. According to both views, Mary's progress consists primarily in getting acquainted with phenomenal blueness from an inner perspective. But contrary to Conee's thesis, according to the New Knowledge/Old Fact View, acquaintance with phenomenal blueness form an experiential perspective enables the subject to form a new concept of phenomenal blueness and thereby implies the capacity to acquire new beliefs.

An example of a more explicit theoretical account of phenomenal character, phenomenal content and their relation can be found in Tye (1995). He proposes a representationalist account of phenomenal character. For a state to have phenomenal character is to represent internal or external physical items in an ‘abstract’ and nonconceptual way that is “appropriately poised for use by the cognitive system” (see Tye, 1996, 137-144). According to Tye, there are two kinds of phenomenal concepts: indexical concepts (an example is the concept applied when thinking of a particular shade of red as “this particular hue” while having a red experience) and what he calls “predicative phenomenal concepts” that are based on the capacity to make certain discriminations. Tye wishes to accommodate the natural intuition that Mary before release cannot fully understand the nature of phenomenal blueness (she doesn't really know what it is to have a blue experience). One might think that his view is incompatible with the intuition at issue. Phenomenal blueness, according to his view, has a physical nature and one might expect that physical natures are fully describable in physical terms and fully understandable under a physical conceptualization. But Tye has a surprising response: Although phenomenal blueness has a physical nature, a person cannot fully understand its nature unless she thinks of phenomenal blueness under a phenomenal concept.

Another representationalist view about phenomenal character is combined with the New Knowledge/Old Fact View in Lycan (1990) and (1996). Lycan's account of Mary's epistemic progress can be put, roughly, like this: Only after release Mary can form “introspective second order representations” of her own color experiences. One may think of an introspective representation as of “a token in one of the subject's languages of thought, his or her Introspectorese”. It has often been said that what Mary learns is in some sense “ineffable”, that it cannot be communicated in public language. Lycan is led to a similar conclusion within his computational theory. In his view, when Mary finally has an experience of blue she “tokens a semantically primitive mental word for the type of first-order state being inwardly sensed.” where this word in Mary's language of thought has an “inferential and/or conceptual role” that is “unique to its subject, in that no other subject could deploy a functionally similar representation whose designatum was that (the subject's) very same first-order state-token,(…).” And he concludes that “the introspective word would certainly not be synonymous with any primitive or composite expression of public English,…” (Lycan (1996), p. 101).

Papineau (1996) distinguishes third person and first person thoughts about experiences. First person thoughts involve the imagination of an experience of the relevant kind. The basic idea may be put like this: When Mary is finally released and after some time sufficiently acquainted with color experiences she can ‘reproduce’ blue experiences in her imagination. These imaginations of experiences of a particular kind can be used to refer to experiences of the kind at issue and to think about them. Obviously, Mary could not have first person thoughts about color experiences (she could not use imagined blue experiences in order to refer and to think about blue experiences) before she ever had blue experiences. After release, Mary can acquire new beliefs: first person beliefs about blue experiences. But for every such new first person belief about a given kind of experience, there will be one of her old third person beliefs which refers to the same kind of experience and has the same factual content.

Perry (2001) argues that Mary's new knowledge after release does not pose a problem to physicalism any more than indexical thoughts like “I am a philosopher” or “today is Sunday” (for a defense of this claim see also McMullen, 1985). He treats Mary's new knowledge as a particular case of demonstrative belief (and he proposes an account of Mary's new beliefs after release in terms of his theory of token-reflexive thoughts). After release, when seeing the sky, Mary may think “Oh, so having blue experiences is like this” where “this” refers to a physical property (the phenomenal character) of her present color experience. She could not have had a demonstrative belief of this kind before release. But, again, the fact that makes the thought true is simply the fact that blue experiences have the particular physical property at issue. Therefore, she does not learn any new fact.

Doubts about Perry's proposal have been raised along the following lines. In normal cases of demonstrative reference the demonstrated object is in some way given to the epistemic subject (when pointing to a table and referring to it by “this table”, the object may be given as “the next table left to me”). But what is the way the kind of experience is given to Mary when she thinks of phenomenal blueness under the demonstrative concept “this kind of experience?” It cannot be the way it feels to have an experience with that property, since this solution, so one may argue, introduces phenomenal characters of phenomenal characters and thus reintroduces the original problem. Maybe “the kind of experience I am now having” is the appropriate candidate. But there are problems with this proposal too (see Chalmers, 2002).

Loar (1996) develops a view similar to Perry's that is, however, immune to the kind of objection just mentioned: Phenomenal concepts are recognitional concepts. To have the phenomenal concept of blueness is to be able to recognize experiences of blueness while having them. The recognitional concept of blueness refers directly to its referent (the physical property of blueness) where this means (in Loar's terminology): there is no other property (no property of that property) involved in the reference fixing. According to Loar's view the recognitional concept of phenomenal blueness refers to the physical property phenomenal blueness in virtue of being ‘triggered’ by that property.

4.8. Objections Against the New Knowledge/Old Fact View

An objection to the New Knowledge/Old Fact View can be made as follows. In standard cases, if a subject does not know a given fact in one way that it does know in some other way, this can be explained by two modes of presentation: the subject knows the fact under one mode of presentation and does not know it under some other mode of presentation. So, for example, a person may know the fact that Venus is a planet under the mode of presentation associated with “the morning star is a planet” and fail to know the very same fact under the mode of presentation associated with “the evening star is a planet.” In this particular case, as in many others, the difference in the mode of presentation involves two different properties that are used to fix the referent. In one mode of presentation Venus is given as the heavenly body visible late in the morning (or some similar property), whereas in the other mode of presentation the object is given as the heavenly body visble early in the evening.

If the New Knowledge/Old Fact View involves two modes of presentation of this sort, then it cannot be used to defend physicalism because this kind of explanation of the supposed double epistemic access to facts concerning phenomenal types would reintroduce non-physical properties at a higher level: the subject would have to be decribed as referring to the phenomenal type at issue by some physical property in case it believes the relevant fact under its physical mode of presentation and as referring to that phenomenal type by some non-physical property in case it believes the relevant fact under its phenomenal mode of presentation.

It has been argued by several authors that the different modes of presentation at issue in the case of beliefs about phenomenal states do involve the introduction of different reference-fixing properties and that therefore the proposal is unsuccessful.Arguments of that kind are found in Lockwood (1989), chapt. 8, McConnell (1994) and White (forthcoming). Chalmers (1996) and (2002) makes a similar point using his framework of primary and secondary intensions. In that framework, primary intensions describe the way a concept picks out its referent in the actual world and the cognitive independence of phenomenal and physical concepts is explained by their different primary intensions. If one singular fact can be known under a physical mode of presentation as well as under a phenomenal mode of presentation, then the two items of knowledge involve two concepts (a phenomenal and a physical concept) with different primary intensions and these different primary intensions correspond to different properties.

Anyone who wishes to argue in the way just mentioned, that the two modes of presentation do involve the introduction of two different reference-fixing properties, must deal with Loar's proposal (see 4.7.). Loar avoids the problem of two reference fixing properties by his claim that phenomenal concepts refer directly to their referent. It has been argued against Loar that his causal account of how phenomenal concepts manage to directly refer to their referent (namely by being triggered by them) cannot appropriately describe the particular cognitive role of phenomenal concepts (see White, forthcoming and Connell (1994)).

5. The Dualist View About the Knowledge Argument

There has not been much discussion of the knowledge argument from a dualist perspective. This is unsurprising given the small number of contemporary philosophers who defend a dualist position (for a prominent exception see Chalmers (1996); the knowledge argument is discussed on pp. 140-146). There are two possible strategies for a dualist to take who wishes to defend the knowledge argument. The first is merely defensive or ‘destructive’ in that it tries to refute the positive theoretical proposals one by one that have been used by physicalists in their objections against the knowledge argument. The second is more ‘constructive’ in that it aims at developing an alternative positive dualist account of phenomenal concepts, phenomenal properties and their relations such that on that account Mary does learn new and nonphysical facts upon release. Examples (or partial examples) for the first strategy may occasionally be found in the literature (compare Warner (1986), Gertler (1999), Raymont (1995) and (1999) and Connell (1994)). Examples for the second are hard to find, but Chalmers (1996) and (2002) exemplify the second strategy. Using his framework of primary and secondary intensions he develops a positive account of what he calls “pure phenomenal concepts” that can be described as incorporating the old and natural intuition that in the case of qualia (phenomenal characters) there is no distinction between appearance and reality, in other words: qualia ‘reveal their nature’ in experience.

The intuitive idea just mentioned has been expressed in different ways. Some say that qualia ‘have no hidden sides’. Others say that qualia are not natural kind terms in that it is not up to the sciences to tell us what having an experience of a particular kind amounts to (we know what it amounts to by having them and attending to the quality at issue). It is quite clear that an account of this intuitive idea has to be one of the ingredients of a dualist defense of the knowledge argument.

According to mainstream opinion the most serious problem for property dualism is the danger of being driven into epiphenomenalism. If phenomenal characters are non-physical properties and if every physical event has a physical cause and if we exclude the possibility of overdetermination (where something is caused by two different causes that are both sufficient), then, arguably, whether or not a state has a particular phenomenal character cannot have any causal relevance. But if qualia are causally impotent, how can a person know that she has an experience with a particular phenomenal character? Many take it to be obvious that a person cannot know that she now has a blue experience unless her blue experience plays a prominent causal role in the formation of her belief at issue. This particular problem has been formulated as an objection against the knowledge argument in Watkins (1989). Until recently Jackson was one of the very few philosophers who embraced epiphenomenalism. But Jackson changed his mind. Jackson (1995) argues that knowledge about qualia is impossible if qualia are epiphenomenal and he concludes that something must be wrong with the knowledge argument. Other possible reactions would be either to doubt that a property dualist must embrace epiphenomenalism or to develop an account of knowledge about one's own phenomenal states that does not imply a causal relation between qualia and phenomenal knowledge about qualia (see Chalmers (2002)).

6. Concluding Remark

The appropriate evaluation of the knowledge argument remains controversial. The acceptability of its second premise P2 (Mary lacks factual knowledge before release) and of the inferences from P1 (Mary has complete physical knowledge before release) to C1 (Mary knows all the physical facts) and from P2 to C2 (Mary does not know some facts before release) depend on quite technical and controversial issues about (a) the appropriate theory of property concepts and their relation to the properties they express and (b) the appropriate theory of belief content. It is therefore safe to predict that the discussion about the knowledge argument will not come to an end in the near future.

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dualism | materialism | physicalism | propositional attitude reports | qualia | self-knowledge