Notes to Gottlob Frege

1. Given our discussion at the end of Section 2.2, in which we pointed out that for Frege, the subject and direct object of a sentence are on a logical par, there is an equally good alternative theoretical description of the denotation of the sentence ‘John loves Mary’. That is, we may equally well suppose d[L] maps d[j] to the function ‘John loves ( )’, and refer to this latter function semantically as d[jL]. Then, d[jL] would map d[m] to the truth-value that serves as the denotation of the sentence ‘John loves Mary’, namely, d[jLm]. Logically speaking, this analysis is equivalent to the one in the text, and serves to show how the subject and direct object of the sentence are on a logical par, in contrast to Aristotelian logic.

2. A similar point to that made in footnote 1 applies here. We could, alternatively, suppose s[L] maps s[j] to s[jL], and that this latter function maps s[m] to the sense of the whole sentence, namely, s[jLm].