Notes to Theoretical Terms in Science

1. To mention only two of these intermediate positions: van Fraassen (1980) accepts a realist semantics for scientific statements but contests that science is aiming at true theories. Dummett's antirealism suggests replacing the notion of truth by provability or warranted assertibility (Dummett 1978; Wright 1993). This alternative to realist semantics has never been worked out for scientific theories in due detail, however.

2. An important difference between Przelecki (1969, Ch. 6) and Andreas (2010) is that only the former requires those sentences that indirectly interpret a symbol to be analytic. This requirement is not in line with Carnap's (1958) view that the analytic-synthetic distinction is not applicable to the single axioms of a scientific theory. Przelecki's (1969) account, however, is more general than that of Andreas (2010) in that it does not assume a complete interpretation of the basic language L(V-o). The merits of both accounts can easily be combined.