Supplement to Death
The Argument: Death and Posthumous Events Don’t Affect Us
Here is a more explicit version of 1–13 (with thanks to Curtis Brown):
Let s,s′,… range over subjects; v,v′,… over events and states; and t,t′,… over times. We can use the following abbreviations:
| SD(v,s,t): | v is the state of s being dead at t |
| harm2(v,s): | v harms s |
| harm3(v,s,t): | v harms s at t |
| t> t’: | t is after t′ |
| t≥t′: | t is after t′ or t=t′ |
We can use the following function symbols:
For any subject s, ED(s) is the event of s’s death
For any event or state v, T(v) is the time v occurs or holds
Next come axioms:
| A1. | ∀v∀s(harm2(v,s) iff ∃tharm3(v,s,t)) |
| A2. | ∀v∀s(v is posthumous for s iff T(v)>T(ED(s))) |
| A3. | ∀v∀s∀t(If SD(v,s), then t>T(ED(s))) |
Then premises:
| P1. | ∀v∀s∀t (If v affects s at t, then v causally affects s at t) |
| P2. | ∀v∀s∀t (If v causally affects s at t, then s exists at t) |
| P3. | ∀v∀s∀t (If harm3(v,s,t), then v affects s at t) |
| P4. | ∀v∀s∀t (If v causally affects s at t, then t≥ T(v)) |
| P5. | ∀v∀s (If t>T(ED(s)), then it is not the case that s exists at t) |
Here are the conclusions to be reached:
| C1. | No posthumous event harms us; i.e., ∀v∀s (If v is posthumous for s, then ∼harm2(v,s)) |
| C2. | We are not harmed by the state of our being dead; i.e., ∀v∀s∀t (If SD(v,s,t), then ∼harm2(v,s)) |
| C3. | The event of death harms us, if at all, only when it occurs;
i.e., ∀v∀s∀t (If v=ED(s)&harm3(v,s,t), then t=T(ED(s))) |
Argument for C1:
Let v1 be any event or state, s1 any subject and t1 any time.
| 1. | v1 is posthumous for s1 | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | harm2(v1,s1) | (assumption for reductio ad absurdum) |
| 3. | T(v1)>T(ED(s1)) | (1, A2, UI, biconditional elimination) |
| 4. | harm3(v1,s1,t) | (2, A1, UI, biconditional elimination, MP) |
| 5. | harm3(v1, s1,t1) | (4, EI) |
| 6. | v1 affects s1 at t1 | (5, P3, UI, MP) |
| 7. | v1 causally affects s1 at t1 | (6, P1, UI, MP) |
| 8. | t1>T(v1) | (7, P4, UI, MP) |
| 9. | t1>T(ED(s1)) | (8, 3, transitivity of >) |
| 10. | ∼s1 exists at t1 | (9, P5, UI, MP) |
| 11. | s1 exists at t1 | (7, P2, UI, MP) |
| 12. | ∼harm2(v1,s1) | (2, 10,11, reductio ad absurdum |
| 13. | If v1 is posthumous for s 1, then ∼harm2(v1,s1) | (1, 13, conditional introduction) |
| 14. | ∀v∀s(If v is posthumous for s, then ∼harm2(v,s)) | (13 UG) |
Argument for C2:
Let v1 be any event or state, s1 any subject and t 1 any time.
| 1. | SD(v1,s1,t1) | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | t1>T(ED(s1)) | (1, A3, UI, MP)) |
| 3. | v1 is posthumous for s1 | (2, A2, biconditional elimination) |
| 4. | ∼harm2(v1,s1) | (3, C1, UI, MP) |
| 5. | If SD(v1,s1,t1), then ∼harm2(v1,s1) |
(1, 4, CI) |
| 6. | ∀v∀s∀t (If SD(v,s,t), then ∼harm2(v,s)) | (5, UG) |
Argument for C3:
Let v1 be any event or state, s1 any subject and t1 any time.
| 1. | v1=ED(s1)&harm3(v1,s1,t1) | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | harm3(ED(s1),s1,t1) | (1, simplication, substitution) |
| 3. | ED(s1) affects s1 at t1 | (2, P3, UI, MP) |
| 4. | ED(s1) causally affects s1 at t1 | (3, P1, UI, MP) |
| 5. | t1≥T(ED(s1)) | (4, P4, UI, MP) |
| 6. | t1>T(ED(s1)) | (assumption for reductio ad absurdum) |
| 7. | ∼s1 exists at t1 | (6, P5, UI, MP) |
| 8. | s1 exists at t1 | (4, P2, UI, MP) |
| 9. | ∼t1>T(ED(s1)) | (6, 8, reductio ad absurdum) |
| 10. | t1=T(ED(s1)) | (5, 9, disjunctive syllogism) |
| 11. | If v1=ED(s1)&harm3(v1,s1,t1), then t1=T(ED(s1)) | (1, 10, conditional introduction) |
| 12. | ∀v∀s∀t (If v=ED(s)&harm3(v,s,t), then t=T(ED((s)) | (11, UG) |
