The Validity of the Argument

That the argument is deductively valid can be seen as follows. First, let us introduce the following abbreviations:

• $\textit{State}(x)$: $x$ is a state of affairs
• $\textit{Dying}(x)$: $x$ is a state of affairs in which an animal dies an agonizing death in a forest fire
• $\textit{Suffering}(x)$: $x$ is a state of affairs in which a child undergoes lingering suffering and eventual death due to cancer
• $\textit{Bad}(x)$: $x$ is intrinsically bad or undesirable
• $\textit{Omnipotent}(x)$: $x$ is omnipotent
• $\textit{Omniscient}(x)$: $x$ is omniscient
• $\textit{MorallyPerfect}(x)$: $x$ is morally perfect
• $\textit{PreventsExistence}(x,y)$: $x$ prevents the existence $y$
• $\textit{God}(x)$: $x$ is God
• $\textit{HasPowerToPreventWithout}(x,y)$: $x$ has the power to prevent the existence of $y$ without hereby either allowing an equal or greater evil, or preventing an equal or greater good

The argument just set out can then be formulated as follows:

• (1) $\exists x [ \textit{State}(x) \wedge ( \textit{Dying}(x) \vee \textit{Suffering}(x) ) \wedge \textit{Bad}(x) \wedge \forall y ( \textit{Omnipotent}(y) \rightarrow \textit{HasPowerToPreventWithout}(y,x) ) ]$
• (2) $\forall x [ \textit{State}(x) \rightarrow \forall z \neg \textit{PreventsExistence}(z,x) ]$
• (3) $\forall x \forall y [ ( \textit{Bad}(x) \wedge \textit{HasPowerToPreventWithout}(y,x) \wedge \neg \textit{PreventsExistence}(y,x) ) \rightarrow \neg ( \textit{Omniscient}(y) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect}(y) ) ]$

Therefore, from (1), (2), and (3),

• (4) $\forall x \neg [ \textit{Omnipotent}(x) \wedge \textit{Omniscient}(x) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect(x)}]$
• (5) $\forall x [ \textit{God}(x) \rightarrow (\textit{Omnipotent}(x) \wedge \textit{Omniscient}(x) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect}(x) )]$

Therefore,

• (6) $\neg \exists x [God(x)]$

The premises here are (1), (2), (3), and (5), and they can be shown to entail the conclusion, (6), as follows.

The Inference from (1), (2), and (3) to (4)

• (i) $\textit{State}(A) \wedge (\textit{Dying}(A) \vee \textit{Suffering}(A)) \wedge \textit{Bad}(a) \wedge \forall y (\textit{Omnipotent}(y) \rightarrow \textit{HasPowerToPreventWithout}(y,A))$
  From (1), via EE (Existential Elimination).
• (ii) $\forall z \neg \textit{PreventsExistence}(z,A)$
  From (2) and 1st conjunct of (i) by UE and MP.
• (iii) $\textit{Omnipotent}(G)$
  Assumption for conditional proof (‘$G$’ arbitrary)
• (iv) $\textit{HasPowerToPreventWithout}(G,A)$
  From 4th conjunct of (i), by instantiating ‘$G$’ and using MP.
• (v) $\neg \textit{PreventsExistence}(G,A)$
  From (ii), by UE.
• (vi) $\textit{Bad}(A) \wedge \textit{HasPowerToPreventWithout}(G,A) \wedge \neg \textit{PreventsExistence}(G,A))$
  Conjoin 3rd conjunct of (i) with (iv) and (v).
• (vii) $\neg(\textit{Omniscient}(y) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect}(G))$
  From (3) and (6), by UE and MP.
• (viii) $\textit{Omnipotent}(G) \rightarrow \neg(\textit{Omniscient}(G) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect}(G))$
  Conditional Proof, (iii)–(vii).
• (ix) $\neg(\textit{Omnipotent}(G) \wedge \textit{Omniscient}(G) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect}(G))$
  From (viii), by the equivalence of $A \rightarrow B$ with $\neg(A \wedge \neg B)$, double negation elimination, and associativity of conjunctions.
• (x) $\forall x \neg(\textit{Omnipotent}(x) \wedge \textit{Omniscient}(x) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect}(x))$
  From (ix), via UI (Universal Introduction), since ‘$G$’ was arbitrary.

The Inference from (4) and (5) to (6)

• (i) $\neg(\textit{Omnipotent}(G) \wedge \textit{Omniscient}(G) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect}(G))$
  From (4), via universal insantiation, and where ‘$G$’ is arbitrary.
• (ii) $\textit{God}(G) \rightarrow (\textit{Omnipotent}(G) \wedge \textit{Omniscient}(G) \wedge \textit{MorallyPerfect}(G))$
  From (5) by universal instantiation.
• (iii) $\neg \textit{God}(G)$
  From (i) and (ii) by modus tollens.
• (iv) $\forall x \neg(\textit{God}(x))$
  From (iii) by universal generalization, since ‘$G$’ was arbitrary.
• (v) $\neg \exists x (\textit{God}(x))$
  From (iv), by interdefinability of quantifiers.

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