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Supplement to Frege's Theorem and Foundations for Arithmetic

Derivation of the Law of Extensions

[Note: We use ϵF to denote the extension of the concept F.]

We want to show, for an arbitrarily chosen concept P and an arbitrarily chosen object c, that cϵPPc.

() Assume cϵP to show Pc). Then, by the definition of , it follows that

H(ϵP=ϵH&Hc)

Suppose that Q is such a property. Then, we know

ϵP=ϵQ&Qc

But, by Basic Law V, the first conjunct implies x(PxQx). So from the fact that Qc, it follows that Pc.

() Assume Pc (to show cϵP). Then, by the Existence of Extensions principle, P has an extension, namely, ϵP. So by the laws of identity, we know ϵP=ϵP. We may conjoin this with our assumption to conclude

ϵP=ϵP&Pc

Now by existential generalizing on the concept P, it follows that

H(ϵP=ϵH&Hc)

Thus, by the definition of , it follows that cϵP.

Copyright © 2018 by
Edward N. Zalta <zalta@stanford.edu>

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