Supplement to Frege's Theorem and Foundations for Arithmetic
Derivation of the Law of Extensions
[Note: We use ϵF to denote the extension of the concept F.]
We want to show, for an arbitrarily chosen concept P and an arbitrarily chosen object c, that c∈ϵP≡Pc.
(→) Assume c∈ϵP to show Pc). Then, by the definition of ∈, it follows that
∃H(ϵP=ϵH&Hc)
Suppose that Q is such a property. Then, we know
ϵP=ϵQ&Qc
But, by Basic Law V, the first conjunct implies ∀x(Px≡Qx). So from the fact that Qc, it follows that Pc.
(←) Assume Pc (to show c∈ϵP). Then, by the Existence of Extensions principle, P has an extension, namely, ϵP. So by the laws of identity, we know ϵP=ϵP. We may conjoin this with our assumption to conclude
ϵP=ϵP&Pc
Now by existential generalizing on the concept P, it follows that
∃H(ϵP=ϵH&Hc)
Thus, by the definition of ∈, it follows that c∈ϵP.