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Supplement to Frege's Theorem and Foundations for Arithmetic

Proof of Lemma Concerning Zero

Let P be an arbitrarily chosen concept. We want to show #P=0¬xPx.

() Assume #P=0. Then, by definition of 0,#P=#[λzzz]. So by Hume's Principle, P is equinumerous to [λzzz]. So, by the definition of equinumerosity, there is an R that maps every object falling under P to a unique object falling under [λzzz] and vice versa. Suppose, for reductio, that xPx, say Pa. Then there is an object, say b, such that Rab and [λzzz]b. But, then, by λ-Conversion, b is not self-identical, which contradicts the laws of identity.

() Suppose ¬xPx. Now as we have seen, the laws of identity guarantee that no object falls under the concept [λzzz]. But then any relation you please bears witness to the fact that P is equinumerous with [λzzz]. For let R be some arbitrary relation. Then (a) every object falling under P bears R to a unique object falling under [λzzz] (since there are no objects falling under P ), and (b) every object falling under [λzzz] is such that there is a unique object falling under P that bears R to it (since there are no objects exemplifying [λzzz]). Since P is therefore equinumerous with [λzzz], it follows by Hume's Principle, that #[λzzz]=#P. But, then, by definition, 0=#P.

Copyright © 2018 by
Edward N. Zalta <zalta@stanford.edu>

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