Supplement to Frege's Theorem and Foundations for Arithmetic
Proof of Lemma Concerning Zero
Let P be an arbitrarily chosen concept. We want to show #P=0≡¬∃xPx.
(→) Assume #P=0. Then, by definition of 0,#P=#[λzz≠z]. So by Hume's Principle, P is equinumerous to [λzz≠z]. So, by the definition of equinumerosity, there is an R that maps every object falling under P to a unique object falling under [λzz≠z] and vice versa. Suppose, for reductio, that ∃xPx, say Pa. Then there is an object, say b, such that Rab and [λzz≠z]b. But, then, by λ-Conversion, b is not self-identical, which contradicts the laws of identity.
(←) Suppose ¬∃xPx. Now as we have seen, the laws of identity guarantee that no object falls under the concept [λzz≠z]. But then any relation you please bears witness to the fact that P is equinumerous with [λzz≠z]. For let R be some arbitrary relation. Then (a) every object falling under P bears R to a unique object falling under [λzz≠z] (since there are no objects falling under P ), and (b) every object falling under [λzz≠z] is such that there is a unique object falling under P that bears R to it (since there are no objects exemplifying [λzz≠z]). Since P is therefore equinumerous with [λzz≠z], it follows by Hume's Principle, that #[λzz≠z]=#P. But, then, by definition, 0=#P.