Theodor W. Adorno

Theodor W. Adorno was one of the most important philosophers and social critics in Germany after World War II. Although less well known among anglophone philosophers than his contemporary Hans-Georg Gadamer, Adorno had even greater influence on scholars and intellectuals in postwar Germany. In the 1960s he was the most prominent challenger to both Sir Karl Popper's philosophy of science and Martin Heidegger's philosophy of existence. Jürgen Habermas, Germany's foremost social philosopher after 1970, was Adorno's student and assistant. The scope of Adorno's influence stems from the interdisciplinary character of his research and of the Frankfurt School to which he belonged. It also stems from the thoroughness with which he examined Western philosophical traditions, especially from Kant onward, and the radicalness to his critique of contemporary Western society. He was a seminal social philosopher and a leading member of the first generation of Critical Theory.

Unreliable translations hampered the initial reception of Adorno's published work in English speaking countries. Since the 1990s, however, better translations have appeared, along with newly translated lectures and other posthumous works that are still being published. These materials not only facilitate an emerging assessment of his work in epistemology and ethics but also strengthen an already advanced reception of his work in aesthetics and cultural theory.

• 1. Biographical Sketch
• 2. Dialectic of Enlightenment
• 3. Critical Social Theory
• 4. Aesthetic Theory
• 5. Negative Dialectics
• 6. Ethics and Metaphysics after Auschwitz
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

1. Biographical Sketch

Born on September 11, 1903 as Theodor Ludwig Wiesengrund, Adorno lived in Frankfurt am Main for the first three decades of his life and the last two (Müller-Doohm 2005, Claussen 2008). He was the only son of a wealthy German wine merchant of assimilated Jewish background and an accomplished musician of Corsican Catholic descent. Adorno studied philosophy with the neo-Kantian Hans Cornelius and music composition with Alban Berg. He completed his Habilitationsschrift on Kierkegaard's aesthetics in 1931, under the supervision of the Christian socialist Paul Tillich. After just two years as a university instructor (Privatdozent), he was expelled by the Nazis, along with other professors of Jewish heritage or on the political left. A few years later he turned his father's surname into a middle initial and adopted “Adorno,” the maternal surname by which he is best known.

Adorno left Germany in the spring of 1934. During the Nazi era he resided in Oxford, New York City, and southern California. There he wrote several books for which he later became famous, including Dialectic of Enlightenment (with Max Horkheimer), Philosophy of New Music, The Authoritarian Personality (a collaborative project), and Minima Moralia. From these years come his provocative critiques of mass culture and the culture industry. Returning to Frankfurt in 1949 to take up a position in the philosophy department, Adorno quickly established himself as a leading German intellectual and a central figure in the Institute of Social Research. Founded as a free-standing center for Marxist scholarship in 1923, the Institute had been led by Max Horkheimer since 1930. It provided the hub to what has come to be known as the Frankfurt School. Adorno became the Institute's director in 1958. From the 1950s stem In Search of Wagner, Adorno's ideology-critique of the Nazi's favorite composer; Prisms, a collection of social and cultural studies; Against Epistemology, an antifoundationalist critique of Husserlian phenomenology; and the first volume of Notes to Literature, a collection of essays in literary criticism.

Conflict and consolidation marked the last decade of Adorno's life. A leading figure in the “positivism dispute” in German sociology, Adorno was a key player in debates about restructuring German universities and a lightning rod for both student activists and their right-wing critics. These controversies did not prevent him from publishing numerous volumes of music criticism, two more volumes of Notes to Literature, books on Hegel and on existential philosophy, and collected essays in sociology and in aesthetics. Negative Dialectics, Adorno's magnum opus on epistemology and metaphysics, appeared in 1966. Aesthetic Theory, the other magnum opus on which he had worked throughout the 1960s, appeared posthumously in 1970. He died of a heart attack on August 6, 1969, one month shy of his sixty-sixth birthday.

2. Dialectic of Enlightenment

Long before “postmodernism” became fashionable, Adorno and Horkheimer wrote one of the most searching critiques of modernity to have emerged among progressive European intellectuals. Dialectic of Enlightenment is a product of their wartime exile. It first appeared as a mimeograph titled Philosophical Fragments in 1944. This title became the subtitle when the book was published in 1947. Their book opens with a grim assessment of the modern West: “Enlightenment, understood in the widest sense as the advance of thought, has always aimed at liberating human beings from fear and installing them as masters. Yet the wholly enlightened earth radiates under the sign of disaster triumphant” (DE 1, translation modified). How can this be, the authors ask. How can the progress of modern science and medicine and industry promise to liberate people from ignorance, disease, and brutal, mind-numbing work, yet help create a world where people willingly swallow fascist ideology, knowingly practice deliberate genocide, and energetically develop lethal weapons of mass destruction? Reason, they answer, has become irrational.

Although they cite Francis Bacon as a leading spokesman for an instrumentalized reason that becomes irrational, Horkheimer and Adorno do not think that modern science and scientism are the sole culprits. The tendency of rational progress to become irrational regress arises much earlier. Indeed, they cite both the Hebrew scriptures and Greek philosophers as contributing to regressive tendencies. If Horkheimer and Adorno are right, then a critique of modernity must also be a critique of premodernity, and a turn toward the postmodern cannot simply be a return to the premodern. Otherwise the failures of modernity will continue in a new guise under contemporary conditions. Society as a whole needs to be transformed.

Horkheimer and Adorno believe that society and culture form a historical totality, such that the pursuit of freedom in society is inseparable from the pursuit of enlightenment in culture (DE xvi). There is a flip side to this: a lack or loss of freedom in society—in the political, economic, and legal structures within which we live—signals a concomitant failure in cultural enlightenment—in philosophy, the arts, religion, and the like. The Nazi death camps are not an aberration, nor are mindless studio movies innocent entertainment. Both indicate that something fundamental has gone wrong in the modern West.

According to Horkheimer and Adorno, the source of today's disaster is a pattern of blind domination, domination in a triple sense: the domination of nature by human beings, the domination of nature within human beings, and, in both of these forms of domination, the domination of some human beings by others. What motivates such triple domination is an irrational fear of the unknown: “Humans believe themselves free of fear when there is no longer anything unknown. This has determined the path of demythologization … . Enlightenment is mythical fear radicalized” (DE 11). In an unfree society whose culture pursues so-called progress no matter what the cost, that which is “other,” whether human or nonhuman, gets shoved aside, exploited, or destroyed. The means of destruction may be more sophisticated in the modern West, and the exploitation may be less direct than outright slavery, but blind, fear-driven domination continues, with ever greater global consequences. The all-consuming engine driving this process is an ever-expanding capitalist economy, fed by scientific research and the latest technologies.

Contrary to some interpretations, Horkheimer and Adorno do not reject the eighteenth-century Enlightenment. Nor do they provide a negative “metanarrative” of universal historical decline. Rather, through a highly unusual combination of philosophical argument, sociological reflection, and literary and cultural commentary, they construct a “double perspective” on the modern West as a historical formation (Jarvis 1998, 23). They summarize this double perspective in two interlinked theses: “Myth is already enlightenment, and enlightenment reverts to mythology” (DE xviii). The first thesis allows them to suggest that, despite being declared mythical and outmoded by the forces of secularization, older rituals, religions, and philosophies may have contributed to the process of enlightenment and may still have something worthwhile to contribute. The second thesis allows them to expose ideological and destructive tendencies within modern forces of secularization, but without denying either that these forces are progressive and enlightening or that the older conceptions they displace were themselves ideological and destructive.

A fundamental mistake in many interpretations of Dialectic of Enlightenment occurs when readers take such theses to be theoretical definitions of unchanging categories rather than critical judgments about historical tendencies. The authors are not saying that myth is “by nature” a force of enlightenment. Nor are they claiming that enlightenment “inevitably” reverts to mythology. In fact, what they find really mythical in both myth and enlightenment is the thought that fundamental change is impossible. Such resistance to change characterizes both ancient myths of fate and modern devotion to the facts.

Accordingly, in constructing a “dialectic of enlightenment” the authors simultaneously aim to carry out a dialectical enlightenment of enlightenment not unlike Hegel's Phenomenology of Spirit. Two Hegelian concepts anchor this project, namely, determinate negation and conceptual self-reflection. “Determinate negation” (bestimmte Negation) indicates that immanent criticism is the way to wrest truth from ideology. A dialectical enlightenment of enlightenment “discloses each image as script. It teaches us to read from [the image's] features the admission of falseness which cancels its power and hands it over to truth” (DE 18). Beyond and through such determinate negation, a dialectical enlightenment of enlightenment also recalls the origin and goal of thought itself. Such recollection is the work of the concept as the self-reflection of thought (der Begriff als Selbstbesinnung des Denkens, DE 32). Conceptual self-reflection reveals that thought arises from the very corporeal needs and desires that get forgotten when thought becomes a mere instrument of human self-preservation. It also reveals that the goal of thought is not to continue the blind domination of nature and humans but to point toward reconciliation. Adorno works out the details of this conception in his subsequent lectures on Kant (KC), ethics (PMP), and metaphysics (MCP) and in his books on Husserl (AE), Hegel (H), and Heidegger (JA). His most comprehensive statement occurs in Negative Dialectics, which is discussed later.

3. Critical Social Theory

Dialectic of Enlightenment presupposes a critical social theory indebted to Karl Marx. Adorno reads Marx as a Hegelian materialist whose critique of capitalism unavoidably includes a critique of the ideologies that capitalism sustains and requires. The most important of these is what Marx called “the fetishism of commodities.” Marx aimed his critique of commodity fetishism against bourgeois social scientists who simply describe the capitalist economy but, in so doing, simultaneously misdescribe it and prescribe a false social vision. According to Marx, bourgeois economists necessarily ignore the exploitation intrinsic to capitalist production. They fail to understand that capitalist production, for all its surface “freedom” and “fairness,” must extract surplus value from the labor of the working class. Like ordinary producers and consumers under capitalist conditions, bourgeois economists treat the commodity as a fetish. They treat it as if it were a neutral object, with a life of its own, that directly relates to other commodities, in independence from the human interactions that actually sustain all commodities. Marx, by contrast, argues that whatever makes a product a commodity goes back to human needs, desires, and practices. The commodity would not have “use value” if it did not satisfy human wants. It would not have “exchange value” if no one wished to exchange it for something else. And its exchange value could not be calculated if the commodity did not share with other commodities a “value” created by the expenditure of human labor power and measured by the average labor time socially necessary to produce commodities of various sorts.

Adorno's social theory attempts to make Marx's central insights applicable to “late capitalism.” Although in agreement with Marx's analysis of the commodity, Adorno thinks his critique of commodity fetishism does not go far enough. Significant changes have occurred in the structure of capitalism since Marx's day. This requires revisions on a number of topics: the dialectic between forces of production and relations of production; the relationship between state and economy; the sociology of classes and class consciousness; the nature and function of ideology; and the role of expert cultures, such as modern art and social theory, in criticizing capitalism and calling for the transformation of society as a whole.

The primary clues to these revisions come from a theory of reification proposed by the Hungarian socialist Georg Lukács in the 1920s and from interdisciplinary projects and debates conducted by members of the Institute of Social Research in the 1930s and 1940s. Building on Max Weber's theory of rationalization, Lukács argues that the capitalist economy is no longer one sector of society alongside others. Rather, commodity exchange has become the central organizing principle for all sectors of society. This allows commodity fetishism to permeate all social institutions (e.g., law, administration, journalism) as well as all academic disciplines, including philosophy. “Reification” refers to “the structural process whereby the commodity form permeates life in capitalist society.” Lukács was especially concerned with how reification makes human beings “seem like mere things obeying the inexorable laws of the marketplace” (Zuidervaart 1991, 76).

Initially Adorno shared this concern, even though he never had Lukács's confidence that the revolutionary working class could overcome reification. Later Adorno called the reification of consciousness an “epiphenomenon.” What a critical social theory really needs to address is why hunger, poverty, and other forms of human suffering persist despite the technological and scientific potential to mitigate them or to eliminate them altogether. The root cause, Adorno says, lies in how capitalist relations of production have come to dominate society as a whole, leading to extreme, albeit often invisible, concentrations of wealth and power (ND 189–92). Society has come to be organized around the production of exchange values for the sake of producing exchange values, which, of course, always already requires a silent appropriation of surplus value. Adorno refers to this nexus of production and power as the “principle of exchange” (Tauschprinzip). A society where this nexus prevails is an “exchange society” (Tauschgesellschaft).

Adorno's diagnosis of the exchange society has three levels: politico-economic, social-psychological, and cultural. Politically and economically he responds to a theory of state capitalism proposed by Friedrich Pollock during the war years. An economist by training who was supposed to contribute a chapter to Dialectic of Enlightenment but never did (Wiggershaus 1994, 313–19), Pollock argued that the state had acquired dominant economic power in Nazi Germany, the Soviet Union, and New Deal America. He called this new constellation of politics and economics “state capitalism.” While acknowledging with Pollock that political and economic power have become more tightly meshed, Adorno does not think this fact changes the fundamentally economic character of capitalist exploitation. Rather, such exploitation has become even more abstract than it was in Marx's day, and therefore all the more effective and pervasive.

The social-psychological level in Adorno's diagnosis serves to demonstrate the effectiveness and pervasiveness of late capitalist exploitation. His American studies of anti-Semitism and the “authoritarian personality” argue that these pathologically extend “the logic of late capitalism itself, with its associated dialectic of enlightenment.” People who embrace anti-Semitism and fascism tend to project their fear of abstract domination onto the supposed mediators of capitalism, while rejecting as elitist “all claims to a qualitative difference transcending exchange” (Jarvis 1998, 63).

Adorno's cultural studies show that a similar logic prevails in television, film, and the recording industries. In fact, Adorno first discovered late capitalism's structural change through his work with sociologist Paul Lazarsfeld on the Princeton University Radio Research Project. He articulated this discovery in a widely anthologized essay “On the Fetish-Character in Music and the Regression of Listening” (1938) and in “The Culture Industry,” a chapter in Dialectic of Enlightenment. There Adorno argues that the culture industry involves a change in the commodity character of art, such that art's commodity character is deliberately acknowledged and art “abjures its autonomy” (DE 127). With its emphasis on marketability, the culture industry dispenses entirely with the “purposelessness” that was central to art's autonomy. Once marketability becomes a total demand, the internal economic structure of cultural commodities shifts. Instead of promising freedom from societally dictated uses, and thereby having a genuine use value that people can enjoy, products mediated by the culture industry have their use value replaced by exchange value: “Everything has value only in so far as it can be exchanged, not in so far as it is something in itself. For consumers the use value of art, its essence, is a fetish, and the fetish—the social valuation [gesellschaftliche Schätzung] which they mistake for the merit [Rang] of works of art— becomes its only use value, the only quality they enjoy” (DE 128). Hence the culture industry dissolves the “genuine commodity character” that artworks once possessed when exchange value still presupposed use value (DE 129–30). Lacking a background in Marxist theory, and desiring to secure legitimacy for “mass art” or “popular culture,” too many of Adorno's anglophone critics simply ignore the main point to his critique of the culture industry. His main point is that culture-industrial hypercommercialization evidences a fateful shift in the structure of all commodities and therefore in the structure of capitalism itself.

4. Aesthetic Theory

Philosophical and sociological studies of the arts and literature make up more than half of Adorno's collected works (Gesammelte Schriften). All of his most important social-theoretical claims show up in these studies. Yet his “aesthetic writings” are not simply “applications” or “test cases” for theses developed in “nonaesthetic” texts. Adorno rejects any such separation of subject matter from methodology and all neat divisions of philosophy into specialized subdisciplines. This is one reason why academic specialists find his texts so challenging, not only musicologists and literary critics but also epistemologists and aestheticians. All of his writings contribute to a comprehensive and interdisciplinary social philosophy (Zuidervaart 2007).

First published the year after Adorno died, Aesthetic Theory marks the unfinished culmination of his remarkably rich body of aesthetic reflections. It casts retrospective light on the entire corpus. It also comes closest to the model of “paratactical presentation” (Hullot-Kentor in AT xi-xxi) that Adorno, inspired especially by Walter Benjamin, found most appropriate for his own “atonal philosophy.” Relentlessly tracing concentric circles, Aesthetic Theory carries out a dialectical double reconstruction. It reconstructs the modern art movement from the perspective of philosophical aesthetics. It simultaneously reconstructs philosophical aesthetics, especially that of Kant and Hegel, from the perspective of modern art. From both sides Adorno tries to elicit the sociohistorical significance of the art and philosophy discussed.

Adorno's claims about art in general stem from his reconstruction of the modern art movement. So a summary of his philosophy of art sometimes needs to signal this by putting “modern” in parentheses. The book begins and ends with reflections on the social character of (modern) art. Two themes stand out in these reflections. One is an updated Hegelian question whether art can survive in a late capitalist world. The other is an updated Marxian question whether art can contribute to the transformation of this world. When addressing both questions, Adorno retains from Kant the notion that art proper (“fine art” or “beautiful art”—schöne Kunst—in Kant's vocabulary) is characterized by formal autonomy. But Adorno combines this Kantian emphasis on form with Hegel's emphasis on intellectual import (geistiger Gehalt) and Marx's emphasis on art's embeddedness in society as a whole. The result is a complex account of the simultaneous necessity and illusoriness of the artwork's autonomy. The artwork's necessary and illusory autonomy, in turn, is the key to (modern) art's social character, namely, to be “the social antithesis of society” (AT 8).

Adorno regards authentic works of (modern) art as social monads. The unavoidable tensions within them express unavoidable conflicts within the larger sociohistorical process from which they arise and to which they belong. These tensions enter the artwork through the artist's struggle with sociohistorically laden materials, and they call forth conflicting interpretations, many of which misread either the work-internal tensions or their connection to conflicts in society as a whole. Adorno sees all of these tensions and conflicts as “contradictions” to be worked through and eventually to be resolved. Their complete resolution, however, would require a transformation in society as a whole, which, given his social theory, does not seem imminent.

As commentary and criticism, Adorno's aesthetic writings are unparalleled in the subtlety and sophistication with which they trace work-internal tensions and relate them to unavoidable sociohistorical conflicts. One gets frequent glimpses of this in Aesthetic Theory. For the most part, however, the book proceeds at the level of “third reflections”—reflections on categories employed in actual commentary and criticism, with a view to their suitability for what artworks express and to their societal implications. Typically he elaborates these categories as polarities or dialectical pairs.

One such polarity, and a central one in Adorno's theory of artworks as social monads, occurs between the categories of import (Gehalt) and function (Funktion). Adorno's account of these categories distinguishes his sociology of art from both hermeneutical and empirical approaches. A hermeneutical approach would emphasize the artwork's inherent meaning or its cultural significance and downplay the artwork's political or economic functions. An empirical approach would investigate causal connections between the artwork and various social factors without asking hermeneutical questions about its meaning or significance. Adorno, by contrast, argues that, both as categories and as phenomena, import and function need to be understood in terms of each other. On the one hand, an artwork's import and its functions in society can be diametrically opposed. On the other hand, one cannot give a proper account of an artwork's social functions if one does not raise import-related questions about their significance. So too, an artwork's import embodies the work's social functions and has potential relevance for various social contexts. In general, however, and in line with his critiques of positivism and instrumentalized reason, Adorno gives priority to import, understood as societally mediated and socially significant meaning. The social functions emphasized in his own commentaries and criticisms are primarily intellectual functions rather than straightforwardly political or economic functions. This is consistent with a hyperbolic version of the claim that (modern) art is society's social antithesis: “Insofar as a social function can be predicated for artworks, it is their functionlessness” (AT 227).

The priority of import also informs Adorno's stance on art and politics, which derives from debates with Lukács, Benjamin, and Bertolt Brecht in the 1930s (Lunn 1982; Zuidervaart 1991, 28–43). Because of the shift in capitalism's structure, and because of Adorno's own complex emphasis on (modern) art's autonomy, he doubts both the effectiveness and the legitimacy of tendentious, agitative, or deliberately consciousness-raising art. Yet he does see politically engaged art as a partial corrective to the bankrupt aestheticism of much mainstream art. Under the conditions of late capitalism, the best art, and politically the most effective, so thoroughly works out its own internal contradictions that the hidden contradictions in society can no longer be ignored. The plays of Samuel Beckett, to whom Adorno had intended to dedicate Aesthetic Theory, are emblematic in that regard. Adorno finds them more true than many other artworks.

Arguably, the idea of “truth content” (Wahrheitsgehalt) is the pivotal center around which all the concentric circles of Adorno's aesthetics turn (Zuidervaart 1991; Wellmer 1991, 1–35 ; Jarvis 1998, 90–123). To gain access to this center, one must temporarily suspend standard theories about the nature of truth (whether as correspondence, coherence, or pragmatic success) and allow for artistic truth to be dialectical, disclosive, and nonpropositional. According to Adorno, each artwork has its own import (Gehalt) by virtue of an internal dialectic between content (Inhalt) and form (Form). This import invites critical judgments about its truth or falsity. To do justice to the artwork and its import, such critical judgments need to grasp both the artwork's complex internal dynamics and the dynamics of the sociohistorical totality to which the artwork belongs. The artwork has an internal truth content to the extent that the artwork's import can be found internally and externally either true or false. Such truth content is not a metaphysical idea or essence hovering outside the artwork. But neither is it a merely human construct. It is historical but not arbitrary; nonpropositional, yet calling for propositional claims to be made about it; utopian in its reach, yet firmly tied to specific societal conditions. Truth content is the way in which an artwork simultaneously challenges the way things are and suggests how things could be better, but leaves things practically unchanged: “Art has truth as the semblance of the illusionless” (AT 132).

5. Negative Dialectics

Adorno's idea of artistic truth content presupposes the epistemological and metaphysical claims he works out most thoroughly in Negative Dialectics. These claims, in turn, consolidate and extend the historiographic and social-theoretical arguments already canvassed. As Simon Jarvis demonstrates, Negative Dialectics tries to formulate a “philosophical materialism” that is historical and critical but not dogmatic. Alternatively, one can describe the book as a “metacritique” of idealist philosophy, especially of the philosophy of Kant and Hegel (Jarvis 1998, 148–74; O'Connor 2004). Adorno says the book aims to complete what he considered his lifelong task as a philosopher: “to use the strength of the [epistemic] subject to break through the deception [Trug] of constitutive subjectivity” (ND xx).

This occurs in four stages. First, a long Introduction (ND 1–57) works out a concept of “philosophical experience” that both challenges Kant's distinction between “phenomena” and “noumena” and rejects Hegel's construction of “absolute spirit.” Then Part One (ND 59–131) distinguishes Adorno's project from the “fundamental ontology” in Heidegger's Being and Time. Part Two (ND 133–207) works out Adorno's alternative with respect to the categories he reconfigures from German idealism. Part Three (ND 209–408), composing nearly half the book, elaborates philosophical “models.” These present negative dialectics in action upon key concepts of moral philosophy (“freedom”), philosophy of history (“world spirit” and “natural history”), and metaphysics. Adorno says the final model, devoted to metaphysical questions, “tries by critical self reflection to give the Copernican revolution an axial turn” (ND xx). Alluding to Kant's self-proclaimed “second Copernican revolution,” this description echoes Adorno's comment about breaking through the deception of constitutive subjectivity.

Like Hegel, Adorno criticizes Kant's distinction between phenomena and noumena by arguing that the transcendental conditions of experience can be neither so pure nor so separate from each other as Kant seems to claim. As concepts, for example, the a priori categories of the faculty of understanding (Verstand) would be unintelligible if they were not already about something that is nonconceptual. Conversely, the supposedly pure forms of space and time cannot simply be nonconceptual intuitions. Not even a transcendental philosopher would have access to them apart from concepts about them. So too, what makes possible any genuine experience cannot simply be the “application” of a priori concepts to a priori intuitions via the “schematism” of the imagination (Einbildungskraft). Genuine experience is made possible by that which exceeds the grasp of thought and sensibility. Adorno does not call this excess the “thing in itself,” however, for that would assume the Kantian framework he criticizes. Rather, he calls it “the nonidentical” (das Nichtidentische).

The concept of the nonidentical, in turn, marks the difference between Adorno's materialism and Hegel's idealism. Although he shares Hegel's emphasis on a speculative identity between thought and being, between subject and object, and between reason and reality, Adorno denies that this identity has been achieved in a positive fashion. For the most part this identity has occurred negatively instead. That is to say, human thought, in achieving identity and unity, has imposed these upon objects, suppressing or ignoring their differences and diversity. Such imposition is driven by a societal formation whose exchange principle demands the equivalence (exchange value) of what is inherently nonequivalent (use value). Whereas Hegel's speculative identity amounts to an identity between identity and nonidentity, Adorno's amounts to a nonidentity between identity and nonidentity. That is why Adorno calls for a “negative dialectic” and why he rejects the affirmative character of Hegel's dialectic (ND 143–61).

Adorno does not reject the necessity of conceptual identification, however, nor does his philosophy claim to have direct access to the nonidentical. Under current societal conditions, thought can only have access to the nonidentical via conceptual criticisms of false identifications. Such criticisms must be “determinate negations,” pointing up specific contradictions between what thought claims and what it actually delivers. Through determinate negation, those aspects of the object which thought misidentifies receive an indirect, conceptual articulation.

The motivation for Adorno's negative dialectic is not simply conceptual, however, nor are its intellectual resources. His epistemology is “materialist” in both regards. It is motivated, he says, by undeniable human suffering—a fact of unreason, if you will, to counter Kant's “fact of reason.” Suffering is the corporeal imprint of society and the object upon human consciousness: “The need to let suffering speak is a condition of all truth. For suffering is objectivity that weighs upon the subject … ” (ND 17–18). The resources available to philosophy in this regard include the “expressive” or “mimetic” dimensions of language, which conflict with “ordinary” (i.e., societally sanctioned) syntax and semantics. In philosophy, this requires an emphasis on “presentation” (Darstellung) in which logical stringency and expressive flexibility interact (ND 18–19, 52–53). Another resource lies in unscripted relationships among established concepts. By taking such concepts out of their established patterns and rearranging them in “constellations” around a specific subject matter, philosophy can unlock some of the historical dynamic hidden within objects whose identity exceeds the classifications imposed upon them (ND 52–53, 162–66).

What unifies all of these desiderata, and what most clearly distinguishes Adorno's materialist epistemology from “idealism,” whether Kantian or Hegelian, is his insisting on the “priority of the object” (Vorrang des Objekts, ND 183–97). Adorno regards as “idealist” any philosophy that affirms an identity between subject and object and thereby assigns constitutive priority to the epistemic subject. In insisting on the priority of the object, Adorno repeatedly makes three claims: first, that the epistemic subject is itself objectively constituted by the society to which it belongs and without which the subject could not exist; second, that no object can be fully known according to the rules and procedures of identitarian thinking; third, that the goal of thought itself, even when thought forgets its goal under societally induced pressures to impose identity on objects, is to honor them in their nonidentity, in their difference from what a restricted rationality declares them to be. Against empiricism, however, he argues that no object is simply “given” either, both because it can be an object only in relation to a subject and because objects are historical and have the potential to change.

Under current conditions the only way for philosophy to give priority to the object is dialectically, Adorno argues. He describes dialectics as the attempt to recognize the nonidentity between thought and the object while carrying out the project of conceptual identification. Dialectics is “the consistent consciousness of nonidentity,” and contradiction, its central category, is “the nonidentical under the aspect of identity.” Thought itself forces this emphasis on contradiction upon us, he says. To think is to identify, and thought can achieve truth only by identifying. So the semblance (Schein) of total identity lives within thought itself, mingled with thought's truth (Wahrheit). The only way to break through the semblance of total identity is immanently, using the concept. Accordingly, everything that is qualitatively different and that resists conceptualization will show up as a contradiction. “The contradiction is the nonidentical under the aspect of [conceptual] identity; the primacy of the principle of contradiction in dialectics tests the heterogeneous according to unitary thought [Einheitsdenken]. By colliding with its own boundary [Grenze], unitary thought surpasses itself. Dialectics is the consistent consciousness of nonidentity” (ND 5).

But thinking in contradictions is also forced upon philosophy by society itself. Society is riven with fundamental antagonisms, which, in accordance with the exchange principle, get covered up by identitarian thought. The only way to expose these antagonisms, and thereby to point toward their possible resolution, is to think against thought—in other words, to think in contradictions. In this way “contradiction” cannot be ascribed neatly to either thought or reality. Instead it is a “category of reflection” (Reflexionskategorie) , enabling a thoughtful confrontation between concept (Begriff) and subject matter or object (Sache): “To proceed dialectically means to think in contradictions, for the sake of the contradiction already experienced in the object [Sache], and against that contradiction. A contradiction in reality, [dialectics] is a contradiction against reality” (ND 144–45).

The point of thinking in contradictions is not simply negative, however. It has a fragile, transformative horizon, namely, a society that would no longer be riven with fundamental antagonisms, thinking that would be rid of the compulsion to dominate through conceptual identification, and the flourishing of particular objects in their particularity. Because Adorno is convinced that contemporary society has the resources to alleviate the suffering it nevertheless perpetuates, his negative dialectics has a utopian reach: “In view of the concrete possibility of utopia, dialectics is the ontology of the false condition. A right condition would be freed from dialectics, no more system than contradiction” (ND 11). Such a “right condition” would be one of reconciliation between humans and nature, including the nature within human beings, and among human beings themselves. This idea of reconciliation sustains Adorno's reflections on ethics and metaphysics.

6. Ethics and Metaphysics after Auschwitz

Like Adorno's epistemology, his moral philosophy derives from a materialistic metacritique of German idealism. The model on “Freedom” in Negative Dialectics (ND 211–99) conducts a metacritique of Kant's critique of practical reason. So too, the model on “World Spirit and Natural History” (ND 300–60) provides a metacritique of Hegel's philosophy of history. Both models simultaneously carry out a subterranean debate with the Marxist tradition, and this debate guides Adorno's appropriation of both Kantian and Hegelian “practical philosophy.”

The first section in the Introduction to Negative Dialectics indicates the direction Adorno's appropriation will take (ND 3–4). There he asks whether and how philosophy is still possible. Adorno asks this against the backdrop of Karl Marx's Theses on Feuerbach, which famously proclaimed that philosophy's task is not simply to interpret the world but to change it. In distinguishing his historical materialism from the sensory materialism of Ludwig Feuerbach, Marx portrays human beings as fundamentally productive and political organisms whose interrelations are not merely interpersonal but societal and historical. Marx's emphasis on production, politics, society, and history takes his epistemology in a “pragmatic” direction. “Truth” does not indicate the abstract correspondence between thought and reality, between proposition and fact, he says. Instead, “truth” refers to the economic, political, societal, and historical fruitfulness of thought in practice.

Although Adorno shares many of Marx's anthropological intuitions, he thinks that a twentieth-century equation of truth with practical fruitfulness had disastrous effects on both sides of the iron curtain. The Introduction to Negative Dialectics begins by making two claims. First, although apparently obsolete, philosophy remains necessary because capitalism has not been overthrown. Second, Marx's interpretation of capitalist society was inadequate and his critique is outmoded. Hence, praxis no longer serves as an adequate basis for challenging (philosophical) theory. In fact, praxis serves mostly as a pretext for shutting down the theoretical critique that transformative praxis would require. Having missed the moment of its realization (via the proletarian revolution, according to early Marx), philosophy today must criticize itself: its societal naivete, its intellectual antiquation, its inability to grasp the power at work in industrial late capitalism. While still pretending to grasp the whole, philosophy fails to recognize how thoroughly it depends upon society as a whole, all the way into philosophy's “immanent truth” (ND 4). Philosophy must shed such naivete. It must ask, as Kant asked about metaphysics after Hume's critique of rationalism, How is philosophy still possible? More specifically, How, after the collapse of Hegelian thought, is philosophy still possible? How can the dialectical effort to conceptualize the nonconceptual—which Marx also pursued—how can this philosophy be continued?

This self-implicating critique of the relation between theory and practice is one crucial source to Adorno's reflections on ethics and metaphysics. Another is the catastrophic impact of twentieth-century history on the prospects for imagining and achieving a more humane world. Adorno's is an ethics and metaphysics “after Auschwitz” (Bernstein 2001, 371–414; Zuidervaart 2007, 48–76). Ethically, he says, Hitler's barbarism imposes a “new categorical imperative” on human beings in their condition of unfreedom: so to arrange their thought and action that “Auschwitz would not repeat itself, [that] nothing similar would happen” (ND 365). Metaphysically, philosophers must find historically appropriate ways to speak about meaning and truth and suffering that neither deny nor affirm the existence of a world transcendent to the one we know. Whereas denying it would suppress the suffering that calls out for fundamental change, straightforwardly affirming the existence of utopia would cut off the critique of contemporary society and the struggle to change it. The basis for Adorno's double strategy is not a hidden ontology, as some have suggested, but rather a “speculative” or “metaphysical” experience. Adorno appeals to the experience that thought which “does not decapitate itself” flows into the idea of a world where “not only extant suffering would be abolished but also suffering that is irrevocably past would be revoked” (403). Neither logical positivist antimetaphysics nor Heideggerian hypermetaphysics can do justice to this experience.

Adorno indicates his own alternative to both traditional metaphysics and more recent antimetaphysics in passages that juxtapose resolute self-criticism and impassioned hope. His historiographic, social theoretical, aesthetic, and negative dialectical concerns meet in passages such as this:

Thought that does not capitulate before wretched existence comes to nought before its criteria, truth becomes untruth, philosophy becomes folly. And yet philosophy cannot give up, lest idiocy triumph in actualized unreason [Widervernunft] … Folly is truth in the shape that human beings must accept whenever, amid the untrue, they do not give up truth. Even at the highest peaks art is semblance; but art receives the semblance … from nonsemblance [vom Scheinlosen] … . No light falls on people and things in which transcendence would not appear [widerschiene]. Indelible in resistance to the fungible world of exchange is the resistance of the eye that does not want the world's colors to vanish. In semblance nonsemblance is promised (ND 404–5).

Addressing such passages is crucial in the ongoing assessment of Adorno's philosophy.

Bibliography

Section 1 lists many of Adorno's books in English, including several he co-authored, in the order of their abbreviations. Section 2 lists some anthologies of Adorno's writings in English. Books listed in section 1 without abbreviations were originally published in English; all others were originally published in German. A date in parentheses following a title indicates either the first German edition or, in the case of posthumous publications, the date of the original lectures. Often the translations cited above have been silently modified. The abbreviation “GS” or “NS” after an entry below tells where this book can be found in Adorno's collected writings. “GS” indicates writings published during Adorno's lifetime and collected in the 20 volumes of Theodor W. Adorno, Gesammelte Schriften, edited by Rolf Tiedemann et al. (Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1970–1986). “NS” indicates posthumous works that are appearing as editions of the Theodor W. Adorno Archive in the collection Nachgelassene Schriften (Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1993–).

For more extensive Adorno bibliographies, see Huhn 2004, Müller-Doohm 2005, and Zuidervaart 2014, an annotated bibliography.

Primary Literature

2. Adorno Anthologies

• The Adorno Reader, ed. B. O'Connor, Oxford: Blackwell, 2000.
• Can One Live after Auschwitz?: A Philosophical Reader, ed. R. Tiedemann, trans. R. Livingstone et al., Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003.
• The Culture Industry: Selected Essays on Mass Culture, ed. J. M. Bernstein, London: Routledge, 1991.
• Essays on Music: Theodor W. Adorno, ed. R. D. Leppert, trans. S. H. Gillespie et al., Berkeley: University of California Press, 2002.

3. Secondary Literature

• Benhabib, S., 1986, Critique, Norm, and Utopia: A Study of the Foundations of Critical Theory, New York: Colombia University Press.
• Benzer, M., 2011, The Sociology of Theodor Adorno, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Bernstein, J. M., 1992, The Fate of Art: Aesthetic Alienation from Kant to Derrida and Adorno, University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press.
• –––, 2001, Adorno: Disenchantment and Ethics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• ––– (ed.), 2010, Art and Aesthetics after Adorno, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Boucher, G., 2013, Adorno Reframed: Interpreting Key Thinkers for the Arts, London: I. B. Tauris.
• Bowie, A., 2013, Adorno and the Ends of Philosophy, Cambridge, Mass.: Polity.
• Brittain, C. C., 2010, Adorno and Theology, London: T. & T. Clark.
• Brunkhorst, H., 1999, Adorno and Critical Theory, Cardiff: University of Wales Press.
• Buck-Morss, S., 1977, The Origin of Negative Dialectics; Theodor W. Adorno, Walter Benjamin and the Frankfurt Institute, New York: Free Press.
• Bürger, P., 1984, Theory of the Avant Garde, trans. M. Shaw, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
• Burke, D. A., et al. (eds.), 2007, Adorno and the Need in Thinking: New Critical Essays, Toronto: University of Toronto Press.
• Claussen, D., 2008, Theodor W. Adorno: One Last Genius, trans. R. Livingstone, Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
• Cook, D., 2004, Adorno, Habermas, and the Search for a Rational Society, New York: Routledge.
• –––, 2011, Adorno on Nature, Durham, UK: Acumen.
• ––– (ed.), 2008, Theodor Adorno: Key Concepts, Durham, UK: Acumen.
• de Vries, H., 2005, Minimal Theologies: Critiques of Secular Reason in Adorno and Levinas, trans. G. Hale, Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press.
• Foster, R., 2007, Adorno: The Recovery of Experience, Albany: State University of New York Press.
• Frankfurter Adorno Blätter, 1992–2003, ed. Theodor W. Adorno Archiv, Munich: Edition Text + Kritik. (Published annually, more or less.)
• Freyenhagen, F., 2013, Adorno’s Practical Philosophy: Living Less Wrongly, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Gibson, N. C., and A. Rubin, (eds.), 2002, Adorno: A Critical Reader, Oxford: Blackwell.
• Geuss, R., 2005, Outside Ethics, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
• Habermas, J., 1987, The Philosophical Discourse of Modernity: Twelve Lectures, trans. F. Lawrence, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Hammer, E., 2005, Adorno and the Political, New York: Routledge.
• –––, 2015, Adorno’s Modernism: Art, Experience, and Catastrophe, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Hansen, M. B., 2012, Cinema and Experience: Siegfried Kracauer, Walter Benjamin, and Theodor W. Adorno, Berkeley: University of California Press.
• Heberle, R. J. (ed.), 2006, Feminist Interpretations of Theodor Adorno. University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press.
• Hellings, J., 2014, Adorno and Art: Aesthetic Theory contra Critical Theory, Houndmills, Basingstoke, Hampshire: Palgrave Macmillan.
• Hohendahl, P. U., 1995, Prismatic Thought: Theodor W. Adorno, Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
• –––, 2013, The Fleeting Promise of Art: Adorno’s Aesthetic Theory Revisited, Ithaca, N. Y.: Cornell University Press.
• Honneth, Axel, 1991, The Critique of Power: Reflective Stages in a Critical Social Theory, trans. K. Baynes, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• –––, 2009, Pathologies of Reason: On the Legacy of Critical Theory, trans. J. Ingram et al., New York: Columbia University Press.
• Huhn, T., and L. Zuidervaart (eds.), 1997, The Semblance of Subjectivity: Essays in Adorno's Aesthetic Theory, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Huhn, T. (ed.), 2004, The Cambridge Companion to Adorno, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Hullot-Kentor, R., 2006, Things beyond Resemblance: Collected Essays on Theodor W. Adorno, New York: Columbia University Press.
• Jäger, L., 2004, Adorno: A Political Biography, trans. S. Spencer, New Haven, Conn.: Yale University Press.
• Jameson, F. 1990, Late Marxism: Adorno, or, The Persistence of the Dialectic, London; New York: Verso.
• Jarvis, S., 1998, Adorno: A Critical Introduction, New York: Routledge.
• ––– (ed.), 2006, Theodor Adorno, 4 vols., London: Routledge.
• Jay, M., 1984, Adorno, Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
• –––, 1996, The Dialectical Imagination, 2d ed., Berkeley: University of California Press.
• Jenemann, D., 2007, Adorno in America, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
• Krakauer, E. L., 1998, The Disposition of the Subject: Reading Adorno's Dialectic of Technology, Evanston, Ill.: Northwestern University Press.
• Lee, L. Y., 2005, Dialectics of the Body: Corporeality in the Philosophy of T. W. Adorno, New York: Routledge.
• Lunn, E., 1982, Marxism and Modernism: An Historical Study of Lukács, Brecht, Benjamin, and Adorno, Berkeley: University of California Press.
• Macdonald, I. and K. Ziarek (eds.), 2008, Adorno and Heidegger: Philosophical Questions, Stanford: Stanford University Press.
• Martinson, M., 2000, Perseverance without Doctrine: Adorno, Self-Critique, and the Ends of Academic Theology, Frankfurt am Main: Peter Lang.
• McArthur, J., 2013, Rethinking Knowledge within Higher Education: Adorno and Social Justice, New York: Bloomsbury Academic.
• Menke, C., 1998, The Sovereignty of Art: Aesthetic Negativity in Adorno and Derrida, trans. N. Solomon, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Morgan, A., 2007, Adorno’s Concept of Life, New York: Continuum.
• Morris, M., 2001. Rethinking the Communicative Turn: Adorno, Habermas, and the Problem of Communicative Freedom, Albany: State University of New York Press.
• Müller-Doohm, S., 2005, Adorno: A Biography, trans. Rodney Livingstone, Cambridge: Polity Press.
• Nicholsen, S. W., 1997, Exact Imagination, Late Work: On Adorno's Aesthetics, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• O'Connor, B., 2004, Adorno's Negative Dialectic: Philosophy and the Possibility of Critical Rationality, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• –––, 2013, Adorno, London: Routledge.
• Paddison, M., 1993, Adorno's Aesthetics of Music, New York: Cambridge University Press.
• Pensky, M., (ed.), 1997, The Actuality of Adorno: Critical Essays on Adorno and the Postmodern, Albany: State University of New York Press.
• Rensmann, L., and S. Gandesha (eds.), 2012, Arendt and Adorno: Political and Philosophical Investigations, Stanford, Calif.: Stanford University Press.
• Rose, G., 1978, The Melancholy Science: An Introduction to the Thought of Theodor W. Adorno, London: Macmillan Press.
• Ross, N. (ed.), 2015, The Aesthetic Ground of Critical Theory: New Readings of Benjamin and Adorno, Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
• Schweppenhäuser, G., 2009, Theodor W. Adorno: An Introduction, Durham: Duke University Press.
• Sherman, D., 2007, Sartre and Adorno: The Dialectics of Subjectivity, Albany: State University of New York Press.
• Sherratt, Y., 2002, Adorno's Positive Dialectic, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Shuster, M., 2014, Autonomy after Auschwitz: Adorno, German Idealism, and Modernity, Chicago: The University of Chicago Press.
• Vogel, S., 1996, Against Nature: The Concept of Nature in Critical Theory, Albany: State University of New York Press.
• Vries, H. de, 2005, Minimal Theologies: Critiques of Secular Reason in Adorno and Levinas, trans. G. Hale., Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press.
• Wellmer, A., 1991, The Persistence of Modernity: Essays on Aesthetics, Ethics, and Postmodernism, trans. D. Midgley, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• –––, 1998, Endgames: The Irreconcilable Nature of Modernity; Essays and Lectures, trans. D. Midgley, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Whitebook, J., 1995, Perversion and Utopia: A Study in Psychoanalysis and Critical Theory, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Wiggershaus, R., 1994, The Frankfurt School: Its History, Theories, and Political Significance, trans. M. Robertson, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Witkin, R. W., 2003, Adorno on Popular Culture, New York: Routledge.
• Zuidervaart, L., 1991, Adorno's Aesthetic Theory: The Redemption of Illusion, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
• Zuidervaart, L., et al., 1998, “Adorno, Theodor Wiesengrund,” Encyclopedia of Aesthetics, Vol. 1, pp. 16–32, ed. M. Kelly, New York: Oxford University Press; second edition, 2014.
• Zuidervaart, L., 2007, Social Philosophy after Adorno, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Zuidervaart, L., 2014, “Theodor Adorno,” Oxford Bibliographies in Philosophy, ed. D. Pritchard, Oxford: Oxford University Press, abridged version available online

Academic Tools

	How to cite this entry.
	Preview the PDF version of this entry at the Friends of the SEP Society.
	Look up topics and thinkers related to this entry at the Internet Philosophy Ontology Project (InPhO).
	Enhanced bibliography for this entry at PhilPapers, with links to its database.

Other Internet Resources

• Archives Center/University Library J.C. Senckenberg at the Johann Wolfgang Goethe University in Frankfurt. This university archive contains the literary bequests of Horkheimer, Pollock, and other of Adorno’s colleagues in the Frankfurt School.
• Association for Adorno Studies
• Theodor W. Adorno Archive/Institute of Social Research, at the Johann Wolfgang Goethe University in Frankfurt.
• Theodor W. Adorno Archive in the Walter Benjamin Archive, at the Akademie der Künste in Berlin.

Related Entries

Benjamin, Walter | contradiction | critical theory | domination | Enlightenment | Habermas, Jürgen | Hegel, Georg Wilhelm Friedrich | Hegel, Georg Wilhelm Friedrich: dialectics | Heidegger, Martin | Horkheimer, Max | Husserl, Edmund | identity | Kant, Immanuel | Lukács, Georg [György] | Marx, Karl | Popper, Karl | postmodernism | rationality | truth | Weber, Max