Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.18

Proposition 2.18.
Let \(C^*_N\) be the greatest fixed point of \(f_E\). Then \(C^*_N (E) = K^*_N (E)\).

Proof.
We have shown that \(\mathbf{K}^*_N (E)\) is a fixed point of \(f_E\), so we only need to show that \(\mathbf{K}^*_N(E)\) is the greatest fixed point. Let \(B\) be a fixed point of \(f_B\). We want to show that \(B \subseteq \mathbf{K}^k_N(E)\) for each value \(k\ge 1\). We will proceed by induction on \(k\). By hypothesis,

\[ B = f_E (B) = \mathbf{K}^1_N (E\cap B) \subseteq \mathbf{K}^1_N (E) \]

by monotonicity, so we have the \(k=1\) case. Now suppose that for \(k=m,\) \(B \subseteq \mathbf{K}^m_N(E).\) Then by monotonicity,

\[\tag{i} \mathbf{K}^1_N(B) \subseteq \mathbf{K}^1_N \mathbf{K}^m_N (E) = \mathbf{K}^{m+1}_N(E) \]

We also have:

\[\tag{ii} B = \mathbf{K}^1_N (E\cap B) \subseteq \mathbf{K}^1_N (B) \]

by monotonicity, so combining (i) and (ii) we have:

\[ B \subseteq \mathbf{K}^1_N (B) \subseteq \mathbf{K}^{m+1}_{N}(E) \]

completing the induction. \(\Box\)

Return to Common Knowledge

Copyright © 2022 by
Peter Vanderschraaf
Giacomo Sillari <gsillari@luiss.it>

This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Please note that some links may no longer be functional.