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Supplement to Epistemic Utility Arguments for Epistemic Norms

Agendas, States of the World, and Probability Functions

  • A finite set of propositions forms an algebra if (i) it contains a tautology and a contradiction, and (ii) it is closed under negation, conjunction, and disjunction.
  • Given a set of propositions F a world relative to F is a function w:F{true,false} such that
    • w()=true if is a tautology; w()=false if is a contradiction;
    • w(¬X)=true iff w(X)=false;
    • w(XY)=true iff w(X)=true or w(Y)=true;
    • w(X & Y)=true iff w(X)=true and w(Y)=true;
    We write WF for the set of all worlds relative to F.
  • A function P:F[0,1] is a probability function if (i) P()=1 and P()=0, and (ii) P(XY)=P(X)+P(Y) whenever X and Y are mutually exclusive.

Epistemic Utility Arguments concerning Outright Beliefs

An individual’s belief set B is a subset of their agenda F.

An epistemic utility function EU for belief sets on agenda F is Jamesian if, for each X in F, there are RX,WX>0 such that: EU(B,w)=XB & w(X)=trueRXXB & w(X)=falseWX

A Jamesian epistemic utility function on F has uniform ratio t if WXRX+WX=t, for all X in F.

Then the Expectation Theorem for the Lockean Thesis follows from this lemma:

Expectation Lemma for the Lockean Thesis. Suppose P is a probability function on F, X is a proposition in X, and 0<R,W. Then:

  1. If P(X)>WR+W, then P(X)×R+P(¬X)×(W)>0.
  2. If P(X)=WR+W, then P(X)×R+P(¬X)×(W)=0.

Dominance Theorem for Almost Lockean Completeness. Suppose B is a belief set and 0t1 is a threshold. Then the following are equivalent:

  1. Relative to any Jamesian epistemic utility function with uniform ratio t, B is not strictly dominated;
  2. B satisfies Almost Lockean Completeness with threshold t.

Proof sketch for the Dominance Theorem for Almost Lockean Completeness. First, we define a matrix. Suppose F={X1,,Xn} and WF={w1,,wm}. Then define the following matrix:

Dt=[d11d1ndm1dmn]

so that:

dij={1twi(Xj)=true  XjB(1t)wi(Xj)=true  XjBtwi(Xj)=false  XjBtwi(Xj)=false  XjB

Then, second, we note that:

  • B is not strictly dominated for any epistemic utility function with uniform ratio t iff there is no vector x such that x0 and Dtx<0.
  • B is Almost Lockean Complete with threshold t iff there is a vector y such that y0 and y0 and yDt0.

And finally we note the following theorem, known as Farkas’ Lemma, which says that the following are equivalent:

  1. There is no vector x such that x0 and Dtx<0.
  2. There is a vector y such that y0 and y0 and yDt0.

QED.

The proof of the Dominance Theorem for Almost Lockean Completeness for Plans proceeds in a similar way.

Epistemic Utility Arguments concerning Precise Credences

A credence function on F is a function C:F[0,1].

CF is the set of credence functions on F.

PFCF is the set of probabilistic credence functions on F.

An epistemic utility function for credence functions on F is a function EU:CF[,0].

Probabilism and the Chance-Credence Norms

The Dominance Theorem for Probabilism and the Chance Dominance Theorem for the General Chance-Credence Norm both follow from the same fact about strictly proper epistemic utility functions, so we state that now:

Dominance Lemma for Convex Hulls. Suppose EU is continuous and strictly proper. And suppose XP. Then:

  1. For every C that is not in in cl(X+), there is C in cl(X+) such that, for all P in X, wWP(w)EU(C,w)<wWP(w)EU(C,w)
  2. For every C in cl(X+) and any CC there is P in X such that, wWP(w)EU(C,w)<wWP(w)EU(C,w)

Proof sketch for the Dominance Theorem for Convex Hulls. The trick is to use the epistemic utility function to define something like a measure of distance from any probabilistic credence function to any other credence function. Given EU and credence functions P, C, where P is probabilistic, define DEU(P,C) to be the difference between the expected epistemic utility of C from the point of view of P and the expected epistemic utility of P from the point of view of P: that is,

DEU(P,C)=ExpP(EU(P))ExpP(EU(C))

We can then show that, for any set X of probabilistic credence functions, if C lies outside cl(X+), then the function DEU(,C) takes a minimum value on cl(X+). And we can show that, if C is the credence function at which it takes that minimum value, then, for all P in X,

DEU(P,C)<DEU(P,C)

And so, unpacking the definition of DEU,

ExpP(EU(C))<ExpP(EU(C))

as required.

Then:

  • the Dominance Theorem for Probabilism follows from this if we let X be the set of omniscient credence functions, Vw for w in W, since P is the closed convex hull of that set;
  • the Chance Dominance Theorem for the General Chance-Credence Norm follows if we let X be the set of possible chance functions.

Conditionalization

  1. An evidential situation is a function E that takes a possible world w and returns the proposition E(w) learned at that possible world in that evidential situation.
  2. An updating rule is a function R that takes a possible world w and returns the credence function Rw endorsed by that plan at that world.
  3. An updating rule R is available at an evidential situation E if, whenever E(w)=E(w), we have Rw=Rw.
  4. An evidential situation is factive if, for every world w, E(w) is true at w.
  5. An evidential situation is partitional if {E(w):wW} forms a partition.
  6. An updating rule R is a conditionalizing rule for prior credence function C and evidential situation E if, for every world w, if C(E(w))<0, then Rw()=C(E(w)).

Expectation Theorem for Partitional Plan Conditionalization. Suppose EU is strictly proper, E is a factive and partitional evidential situation, and C is a probabilistic credence function. Then:

  1. For any updating rules R,R, if R and R are both conditionalizing rules for C and E, wWC(w)EU(Rw,w)=wWC(w)EU(Rw,w)
  2. For any available updating rules R,R, if R is a conditionalizing rule for C and E, but R is not, then wWC(w)EU(Rw,w)<wWC(w)EU(Rw,w)

Proof sketch for the Expectation Theorem for Partitional Plan Conditionalization. We prove (ii). Since E is partitional, let {E(w):wW}={E1,,En}, write Ri for the credence function that R recommends at each world at which Ei is true and write Ri for the credence function that R recommends at each world at which Ei is true. Then, for each Ei with C(Ei)>0, since EU is strictly proper and Ri is a probabilistic credence function,

wWRi(w)EU(Ri,w)wWRi(w)EU(Ri,w)

with strict inequality if RiRi. But Ri()=C(Ei), so

wWC(wEi)EU(Ri,w)wWC(wEi)EU(Ri,w)

again with strict inequality if RiRi. And so

wEiC(w)EU(Ri,w)wEiC(w)EU(Ri,w)

again with strict inequality if RiRi. Since Ri is conditionalizing and Ri is not, there is some Ei such that RiRi, and so

EiwEiC(w)EU(Ri,w)<EiwEiC(w)EU(Ri,w)

And so

wWC(w)EU(Rw,w)<wWC(w)EU(Rw,w)

as required.

Dominance Theorem for Partitional Plan Conditionalization. Suppose EU is additive, continuous, and strictly proper, E is a factive and partitional evidential situation, C is a probabilistic credence function, and R is an available updating plan in E. Then:

  1. If R is not a conditionalizing plan for C and E, there is a credence function C and an updating plan R that is available in E such that, for all w in W, EU(C,w)+EU(Rw,w)<EU(C,w)+EU(Rw,w)
  2. If R is a conditionalizing plan for C and E, then there is no credence function C and updating plan R that is available in E such that, for all w in W, EU(C,w)+EU(Rw,w)<EU(C,w)+EU(Rw,w)

Proof sketch for the Dominance Theorem for Partitional Plan Conditionalization. We'll sketch the proof of (i). Suppose EU(C,w)=XFs(Vw(X),C(X)). Then we define a measure of distance from one credence function to another as follows:

  • First, given two credences, p and q, define ds(p,q)=(ps(1,p)(1p)s(0,p))(ps(1,q)(1p)s(0,q)).
  • Second, given two credence functions, C,C, define Ds(C,C)=XFds(C(X),C(X)).

Next, since E is partitional, let {E(w):wW}={E1,,En}. Now suppose R is an available updating plan in E, and write Ri for the credence function it endorses at any world at which Ei is true. Next, write F={X1,,Xm}, represent a credence function C by the vector (C(X1),,C(Xm)), write CC for the concatenation of C and C, which is (C(X1),,C(Xm),C(X1),,C(Xm)), and define

¯R={VwR1Ri1VwRi+1Rn:
    i=1,,n & wEi}

Then, if R is not a conditionalizing plan for C,

CR1Rn¯R+

It then follows that there is a credence function C and an updating rule R that is available in E such that

CR1Rn¯R+

such that, for all i=1,,n and all w in Ei,

Ds(Vw,C)+Ds(R1,R1)++Ds(Ri1,Ri1) +
    Ds(Vw,Ri)+Ds(Ri+1,Ri+1)++Ds(Rn,Rn) >
Ds(Vw,C)+Ds(R1,R1)++Ds(Ri1,Ri1) +
    Ds(Vw,Ri)+Ds(Ri+1,Ri+1)++Ds(Rn,Rn)

But then, since Ds(C,C)=0, Ds(Ri,Ri)=0, and Ds(Ri,Ri)0,

Ds(Vw,C)+Ds(Vw,Ri)>Ds(Vw,C)+Ds(Vw,Ri)

And so

EU(C,w)+EU(Ri,w)<EU(C,w)+EU(Ri,w)

as required.

Copyright © 2023 by
Richard Pettigrew <richard.pettigrew@bris.ac.uk>

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