Transmission of Justification and Warrant

Ted is on his way to the Philosophy Department, early in the freezing morning. Although he doesn’t know how cold it is, Ted conjectures that the temperature must be below 0°C. Out of curiosity, he checks the weather app of his smartphone. To his astonishment, he sees it is −30°C. He concludes that this is the least temperature to which he has been exposed ever. Ted’s belief about his personal record owes its justification to Ted’s belief that it is −30°C, justified by the evidence supplied by his smartphone, and Ted’s acknowledging that if it is −30°C, then this is the least temperature to which he has been exposed ever. When one’s belief that \(q\) derives its justification from the justification that one has for another belief that \(p\) in this way, it has become customary to say that the justification for \(p\) transmits to \(q\) across the inferential link from \(p\) to \(q\).

Transmission of justification across inference is a valuable and ubiquitous epistemic phenomenon in everyday life and science. Thanks to epistemic transmission, inferential reasoning can substantiate predictions of future events and, more generally, can expand the sphere of our justified beliefs or reinforce the justification of beliefs we already entertain. However, transmission of justification is not without exceptions. As some epistemologists have come to realize, more or less trivial forms of circularity can prevent justification from transmitting from \(p\) to \(q\) even if one has justification for \(p\) and one is aware of the inferential link from \(p\) to \(q\). In interesting cases this happens because one can acquire justification for \(p\) only if one has independent justification for \(q\). In this case the justification for \(q\) cannot depend on the justification for \(p\) and the inferential link from \(p\) to \(q\), as genuine transmission would require.

The phenomenon of transmission failure seems to shed light on philosophical puzzles, such as Moore’s proof of a material world and McKinsey’s paradox, and it plays a central role in various philosophical debates. For this reason it is granted continued and increasing attention.

• 1. Introduction
• 2. Epistemic Transmission
• 3. Failure of Epistemic Transmission
  • 3.1 Trivial Transmission Failure versus Non-Transmissivity
  • 3.2 Varieties of Non-Transmissive Arguments
  • 3.3 Non-Standard Accounts
• 4. Applications
  • 4.1 Moorean Proofs, Perceptual Justification and Religious Justification
  • 4.2 McKinsey’s Paradox
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

• Supplement: Transmission of Propositional Justification versus Transmission of Doxastic Justification.
• Supplement: Bayesian Formalizations of the Information-Dependence Template

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1. Introduction

Arthur has the measles and stays in a closed environment with his sister Mafalda. If Mafalda ends up contracting the measles herself because of her staying in close contact with Arthur, there must be something—the measles virus—which is transmitted from Arthur to Mafalda in virtue of a relation—the relation of staying in close contact with one another—instantiated by the two siblings. Epistemologists have been devoting their attention to the fact that epistemic properties—like being justified or known—are often transmitted in a similar way. An example (not discussed in this entry) is the transmission of knowledge via testimony. A different but equally important phenomenon (which occupies center stage in this entry) is the transmission of epistemic justification across an inference or argument from one proposition to another.

Consider proposition \(q\) constituting the conclusion of an argument having proposition \(p\) as premise (where \(p\) can be a set or conjunction of propositions). If \(p\) is justified for a subject \(s\) by evidence \(e\), this justification may transmit to \(q\) if \(s\) is aware of the entailment between \(p\) and \(q\). When this happens, \(q\) is justified for \(s\) in virtue of her justification for \(p\) based on \(e\) and her knowledge of the inferential relation from \(p\) to \(q\). Consider this example from Wright (2002):

Here \(s\) can deductively infer \(\rQ_1\) from \(\rP_1\) given background information.^[1] Suppose \(s\) acquires justification for \(\rP_1\) by learning \(\rE_1\). \( s\) will also acquire justification for \(\rQ_1\) in virtue of her knowledge of the inferential relation from \(\rP_1\) to \(\rQ_1\) and her justification for \(\rP_1\).^[2] Thus, \(s\)’s justification for \(\rP_1\) will transmit to \(\rQ_1\).

It is widely recognized that epistemic justification sometimes fails to transmit across an inference or argument. In interesting cases of transmission failure, \(s\) has justification for believing \(p\) and knows the inferential link between \(p\) and \(q\), but \(s\) has no justification for believing \(q\) in virtue of her justification for \(p\) and her knowledge of the inferential link. Here is an example from Wright (2003). Suppose \(s\)’s background information entails that Jessica and Jocelyn are indistinguishable twins. Consider this possible reasoning:

In Twins \(\rE_2\) can give \(s\) justification for believing \(\rP_2\) only if \(s\) has independent justification for believing \(\rQ_2\) in the first instance. Suppose that \(s\) does have independent justification for believing \(\rQ_2\), and imagine that \(s\) learns \(\rE_2\). In this case \(s\) will acquire justification for believing \(\rP_2\) from \(\rE_2\). But it is intuitive that \(s\) will acquire no justification for \(\rQ_2\) in virtue of her justification for believing \(\rP_2\) based on \(\rE_2\) and her knowledge of the inferential link between \(\rP_2\) and \(\rQ_2\). So, Twins instantiates transmission failure when \(\rQ_2\) is independently justified.

An argument incapable of transmitting to its conclusion a specific justification for its premise(s)—e.g., a justification based on evidence \(e\)—may be able to transmit to the same conclusion a different justification for its premise(s)—e.g., one based on different evidence \(e^*\). Replace for instance \(\rE_2\) with

\(\rE_2^*.\)

This girl’s passport certifies she is Jessica.

in Twins, \(\rE_2^*\) can provide \(s\) with justification for believing \(\rP_2\) even if \(s\) has no independent justification for \(\rQ_2\). Suppose then that \(s\) has no independent justification for \(\rQ_2\), and that she acquires \(\rE_2^*\). It is intuitive that \(s\) will acquire justification from \(\rE_2^*\) for \(\rP_2\) that does transmit to \(\rQ_2\). Now the inference from \(\rP_2\) to \(\rQ_2\) instantiates epistemic transmission.

Although many of the epistemologists participating in the debate on epistemic transmission and transmission failure speak of transmission of warrant, rather than justification, almost all of them use the term ‘warrant’ to refer to some kind of epistemic justification (in Sect. 3.3 we will however consider an account of warrant transmission failure in which ‘warrant’ is interpreted differently.) Most epistemologists investigating epistemic transmission and transmission failure—e.g., Wright (2011, 2007, 2004, 2003, 2002 and 1985), Davies (2003, 2000 and 1998), Dretske (2005), Pryor (2004), Moretti (2012) and Moretti & Piazza (2013)—broadly identify the epistemic property capable of being transmitted with propositional justification.^[3] Only a few authors explicitly focus on transmission of doxastic justification—e.g., Silins (2005), Davies (2009) and Tucker (2010a and 2010b [OIR]). In this entry we follow the majority in discussing transmission and transmission failure of justification as phenomena primarily pertaining to propositional justification. (See however the supplement on Transmission of Propositional Justification versus Transmission of Doxastic Justification.)

Epistemologists typically concentrate on transmission of (propositional or doxastic) justification across deductively valid (given background information) arguments. The fact that justification can transmit across deduction is crucial for our cognitive processes because it makes the advancement of knowledge—or justified belief—through deductive reasoning possible. Suppose evidence \(e\) gives you justification for believing hypothesis \(p\), and you know that \(p\) entails another proposition \(q\) that you haven’t directly checked. If the justification you have for believing \(p\) transmits to its unchecked prediction \(q\) through the entailment, you acquire justification for believing \(q\) too.

Epistemologists may analyze epistemic transmission across inductive (or ampliative) inferences too. Yet this topic has received much less attention in the literature on epistemic transmission. (See however interesting remarks in Tucker 2010a.)

In the remaining part of this entry we will focus on transmission and transmission failure of propositional justification across deductive inference. Unless differently specified, by ‘epistemic justification’ or ‘justification’ we always mean ‘propositional justification’.

2. Epistemic Transmission

As said, \(s\)’s justification for \(p\) based on evidence \(e\) transmits across entailment from \(p\) to \(p\)’s consequence \(q\) whenever \(q\) is justified for \(s\) in virtue of \(s\)’s justification for \(p\) based on \(e\) and her knowledge of \(q\)’s deducibility from \(p\). This initial characterization can be distilled into three conditions individually necessary and jointly sufficient for epistemic transmission:

\(s\)’s justification for \(p\) based on \(e\) transmits to \(p\)’s logical consequence \(q\) if and only if:

(C1)

\(s\) has justification for believing \(p\) based on \(e\),

(C2)

\(s\) knows that \(q\) is deducible from \(p\),

(C3)

\(s\) has justification for believing \(q\) in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1) and (C2).

Condition (C3) is crucial for distinguishing transmission of justification across (known) entailment from closure of justification across (known) entailment. Saying that \(s\)’s justification for believing \(p\) is closed under \(p\)’s (known) entailment to \(q\) is saying that:

If

(C1)

\(s\) has justification for believing \(p\) and

(C2)

\(s\) knows that \(p\) entails \(q\), then

(C3\(^{\textrm{c}}\))

\(s\) has justification for believing \(q\).

One can coherently accept the above principle—known as the principle of epistemic closure—but deny a corresponding principle of epistemic transmission, cashed out in terms of the conditions outlined above:

If

(C1)

\(s\) has justification for believing \(p\) and

(C2)

\(s\) knows that \(p\) entails \(q\), then

(C3)

\(s\) has justification for believing \(q\) in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1) and (C2).

The principle of epistemic closure just requires that when \(s\) has justification for believing \(p\) and knows that \(q\) is deducible from \(p, s\) have justification for believing \(q\). In addition, the principle of epistemic transmission requires this justification to be had in virtue of her having justification for \(p\) and knowing that \(p\) entails \(q\) (for further discussion see Tucker 2010b [OIR]).

Another important distinction is the one between the principle of epistemic transmission and a different principle of transmission discussed by Pritchard (2012a) under the label of evidential transmission principle. According to it,

If \(s\) perceptually knows that \(p\) in virtue of evidence set \(e\), and \(s\) competently deduces \(q\) from \(p\) (thereby coming to believe that \(q\) while retaining her knowledge that \(p)\), then \(s\) knows that \(q\), where that knowledge is sufficiently supported by \(e\). (Pritchard 2012a: 75)

Pritchard’s principle, to begin with, concerns (perceptual) knowledge and not propositional justification. Moreover, it deserves emphasis that there are inferences that apparently satisfy Pritchard’s principle but fail to satisfy the principle of epistemic transmission. Consider for instance the following triad:

According to Pritchard, the evidence set of a normal zoo-goer standing before the zebra enclosure typically includes, above and beyond \(\rE_3\), the background proposition that

\((\rE_B)\)

to disguise mules like zebras would be very costly and time-consuming, would bring no comparable benefit and would be relatively easy to unmask.

Suppose \(s\) knows \(\rP_3\) on the basis of her evidence set, and competently deduces \(\rQ_3\) from \(\rP_3\) thereby coming to believe \(\rQ_3\). Pritchard’s evidential transmission principle apparently accommodates the fact that \(s\) thereby comes to know \(\rQ_3\). For her evidence set—because of its inclusion of \(\rE_B\)—sufficiently supports \(\rQ_3\). But the principle of epistemic transmission is not satisfied. Although

(C1\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

\(s\) has justification for \(\rP_3\) and

(C2\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

she knows that \(\rP_3\) entails \(\rQ_3\),

she has justification for believing \(\rQ_3\) in virtue of, not (C1\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\)) and (C2\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\)), but the independent support lent to it by \(\rE_B\).

Condition (C3) suffices to distinguish the notion of epistemic transmission from different notions in the neighborhood. However, as it stands, it is still unsuitable for the purpose to completely characterize epistemic transmission. The problem is that there are cases in which it is intuitive that the justification for \(p\) based on \(e\) transmits to \(q\) even if (C3), strictly speaking, is not satisfied. These cases can be described as situations in which only part of the justification that \(s\) has for \(q\) is based on her justification for \(p\) and her knowledge of the entailment from \(p\) to \(q\). Consider this example. Suppose you are traveling on a train heading to Edinburgh. At 16:00, as you enter Newcastle upon Tyne, you spot the train station sign. Then, at 16:05, the ticket controller tells you that you are not yet in Scotland. Now consider the following reasoning:

As you learn \(\rE_4\), given suitable background information, you get justification for \(\rP_4\); moreover, to the extent to which you know that not being in Scotland is sufficient for not being in Edinburgh, you also acquire via transmission justification for \(\rQ_4\). This additional justification is transmitted irrespective of the fact that you already have justification for \(\rQ_4\), acquired by spotting the train station sign ‘Newcastle upon Tyne’. If (C3) were read as requiring that the whole of the justification available for a proposition \(q\) were had in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1) and (C2), cases like these would become invisible.

Much of the extant literature on epistemic transmission concentrates on examples of transmission of first-time justification. These examples include Toadstool. We have seen, however, that what intuitively transmits in other cases is simply additional justification. Epistemologists have identified at least two—possibly overlapping—kinds of additional justification (cf. Moretti & Piazza 2013).

One is what can be called independent justification because it appears—intuitively—independent of the original justification for \(q\). This notion of justification can probably be sharpened by appealing to counterfactual analysis. Suppose \(s\)’s justification for \(p\) based on \(e\) transmits to \(p\)’s logical consequence \(q\). This justification transmitted to \(q\) is an additional independent justification just in case these three conditions are met:

(IN1)

\(s\) was already justified in believing \(q\) before acquiring \(e\),

(IN2)

as \(s\) acquires \(e, s\) is still justified in believing \(q\), and

(IN3)

if \(s\) had not been antecedently justified in believing \(q\), upon learning \(e, s\) would have acquired via transmission a first-time justification for believing \(q\).

Journey instantiates transmission of justification by meeting (IN1), (IN2), and (IN3). Thus, Journey exemplifies a case of transmission of additional independent justification.

Consider now that justification for a proposition or belief normally comes in degrees of strength. The second kind of additional justification can be characterized as quantitatively strengthening justification. Suppose again that \(s\)’s justification for \(p\) based on \(e\) transmits to \(p\)’s consequence \(q\). This justification transmitted to \(q\) is an additional quantitatively strengthening justification just in case these two conditions are satisfied:

(STR1)

\(s\) was already justified in believing \(q\) before acquiring \(e\), and

(STR2)

as \(s\) acquires \(e\), the strength of \(s\)’s justification for believing \(q\) increases.

Here is an example from Moretti (2012). Your background information says that only one ticket out of 5,000 of a fair lottery has been bought by a person born in 1970, and that all other tickets have been bought by older or younger people. Consider now this reasoning:

Given its high chance, \(\rQ_5\) is already justified on your background information only. It is intuitive that as you learn \(\rE_5\), you acquire an additional quantitatively strengthening justification for \(\rQ_5\) via transmission. For your justification for \(\rP_5\) transmitted to \(\rQ_5\) is intuitively quantitatively stronger than your initial justification for \(\rQ_5\).

In many cases when \(q\) receives via transmission from \(p\) an additional independent justification, \(q\) also receives a quantitatively strengthening justification. This is not always true though. For there seem to be cases in which an additional independent justification transmitted from \(p\) to \(q\) intuitively lessens an antecedent justification for \(q\) (cf. Wright 2011).

An interesting question is whether it is true that as \(q\) gets via transmission from \(p\) an additional quantitatively strengthening justification, \(q\) also gets an independent justification. This seems true in some cases—for instance in Lottery. It is controversial, however, if it is the case that whenever \(q\) gets via transmission a quantitatively strengthening justification, \(q\) also gets an independent justification. Wright (2011) and Moretti & Piazza (2013) describe two examples in which a subject allegedly receives via transmission a quantitatively strengthening but not independent additional justification.

To summarize, additional justification comes in two species at least: independent justification and quantitatively strengthening justification. This enables us to lay down three specifications of the general condition (C3\(^{+}\)) necessary for justification transmission, each of which represents a condition necessary for the transmission of one particular type of justification. Let’s call these specifications (C3\(^{\textrm{ft}}\)), (C3\(^{\textrm{ai}}\)), and (C3\(^{\textrm{aqs}}\)).

(C3\(^{\textrm{ft}}\))

\(s\) has first time justification for \(q\) in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1) and (C2).

(C3\(^{\textrm{ai}}\))

\(s\) has additional independent justification for \(q\) in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1) and (C2).

(C3\(^{\textrm{aqs}}\))

\(s\) has additional quantitatively strengthening justification for \(q\) in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1) and (C2).

Transmission of first-time justification makes the advancement of justified belief through deductive reasoning possible. Yet the acquisition of first-time justification for \(q\) isn’t the sole possible improvement of one’s epistemic position relative to \(q\) that one could expect from transmission of justification. Moretti & Piazza (2013), for instance, describe a variety of different ways in which s’s epistemic standing toward a proposition can be improved upon acquiring an additional justification for it via transmission.

We conclude this section with a note about transmissivity as resolving doubts. Let us say that \(s\) doubts \(q\) just in case \(s\) either disbelieves or withholds belief about \(q\), namely, refrains from both believing and disbelieving \(q\) after deciding about \(q\). \(s\)’s doubting \(q\) should be distinguished from \(s\)’s being open minded about \(q\) and from \(s\)’s having no doxastic attitude whatsoever towards \(q\) (cf. Tucker 2010a). Let us say that a deductively valid argument from \(p\) to \(q\) is able to resolve doubt about its conclusion just in case it is possible for \(s\) to be rationally moved from doubting \(q\) to believing \(q\) solely in virtue of grasping the argument from \(p\) to \(q\) and the evidence offered for \(p\).

Some authors (e.g., Davies 1998, 2003, 2004, 2009; McLaughlin 2000; Wright 2002, 2003, 2007) have proposed that we should conceive of an argument’s epistemic transmissivity in a way that is very closely related or even identical to the argument’s ability to resolve doubt about its conclusion. Whereas some of these authors have eventually conceded that epistemic transmissivity cannot be defined as ability to resolve doubt (e.g., Wright 2011), others have attempted to articulate this view in full (see mainly Davies 2003, 2004, 2009).

However, there is nowadays wide agreement in the literature that the property of being a transmissive argument doesn’t coincide with the one of being an argument able to resolve doubt about its conclusion (see for example, Beebee 2001; Coliva 2010; Markie 2005; Pryor 2004; Bergmann 2004, 2006; White 2006; Silins 2005; Tucker 2010a). A good reason to think so is that whereas the property of being transmissive appears to be a genuinely epistemic property of an argument, the one of resolving doubt seems to be only a dialectical feature of it, which varies with the audience whose doubt the argument is used to address.

3. Failure of Epistemic Transmission

3.1 Trivial Transmission Failure versus Non-Transmissivity

It is acknowledged that justification sometimes fails to transmit across known entailment (the acknowledgment dates back at least to Wright 1985). Moreover, it is no overstatement to say that the literature has investigated transmission failure more extensively than transmission of justification. As we have seen, justification based on \(e\) transmits from \(p\) to \(q\) across the entailment if and only if

(C1)

\(s\) has justification for \(p\) based on \(e\),

(C2)

\(s\) knows that \(q\) is deducible from \(p\), and

(C3\(^{+}\))

at least part of \(s\)’s justification for \(q\) is based on the satisfaction of (C1) and (C2).

It follows from this characterization that no justification based on e transmits from \(p\) to \(q\) across the entailment if (C1), (C2), or (C3\(^{+}\)) are not satisfied. These are cases of transmission failure.

Some philosophers have argued that knowledge and justification are not always closed under competent (single-premise or multiple-premise) deduction. In the recent literature, the explanation of closure failure has often been essayed in terms of agglomeration of epistemic risk. This type of explanation is less controversial when applied to multi-premise deduction. An example of it concerning justification is the deduction from a high number \(n\) of premises, each of which specifies that a different ticket in a fair lottery won’t win, which are individually justified even though each premise is somewhat risky, to the conclusion that none of these \(n\) tickets will win, which is too risky to be justified. (For more controversial cases in which knowledge or justification closure would fail across single-premise deduction because of risk accumulation, see for example Lasonen-Aarnio 2008 and Schechter 2013; for responses, see for instance Smith 2013 and 2016.) These cases of failure of epistemic closure can be taken to also involve failure of justification transmission. For instance, it can be argued that even if

(C1\(^{*}\))

\(s\) has justification for each of the \(n\) premises stating that a ticket won’t win, and

(C2\(^{*}\))

\(s\) knows that it follows from these premises that none of the \(n\) tickets will win,

\(s\) has no justification—and, therefore, no justification in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1\(^{*}\)) and (C2\(^{*}\))—for believing that none of the \(n\) tickets will win. In these cases, transmission failure appears to be a consequence of closure failure, and it is therefore natural to treat the former simply as a symptomatic manifestation of the latter. For this reason, we will follow the current literature on transmission failure in not discussing these cases. (For an analysis of closure failure, see the entry on epistemic closure, especially section 6.)

The current literature treats transmission failure as a self-standing phenomenon, in the sense that it focuses on cases in which transmission failure is not imputed—and thus not considered reducible—to an underlying failure of closure. For the rest of this entry, we shall follow suit and investigate transmission failure in this pure or genuine form.

The most trivial cases of transmission failure are such that (C3\(^{+}\)) is unsatisfied because (C1) or (C2) are unsatisfied, but it is also true that (C3\(^{+}\)) would have been satisfied if both (C1) and (C2) have been satisfied (cf. Tucker 2010b [OIR]). It deserves emphasis that these cases involve arguments that aren’t unsuitable for the purpose to transmit justification depending on evidence \(e\): had the epistemic circumstances been congenial to the satisfaction of (C1) and (C2), these arguments would have transmitted the justification based on \(e\) from \(p\) to \(q\). As we could put the point, these arguments are transmissive of the justification depending on \(e\).^[4]

Cases of transmission failure of a more interesting variety are those in which, regardless of the validity of closure of justification, (C3\(^{+}\)) isn’t satisfied because it could not have been satisfied, no matter whether or not (C1) and (C2) have been satisfied. These cases concern arguments non-transmissive of justification depending on a given evidence, i.e., arguments incapable of transmitting justification depending on that evidence under any epistemic circumstance. An example in point is Twins. Suppose first that \(s\) has independent justification for \(\rQ_2\). In those circumstances

(C1\(_{\textit{Twins}}\))

\(s\) has justification from \(\rE_2\) for \(\rP_2\).

Furthermore

(C2\(_{\textit{Twins}}\))

\(s\) does know that \(\rP_2\) entails \(\rQ_2\).

However, \(s\) hasn’t justification for \(\rQ_2\) in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1\(_{\textit{Twins}}\)) and (C2\(_{\textit{Twins}}\)). So (C3\(^{+}\)) is not met. Suppose now that \(s\) has no independent justification for \(\rQ_2\). Then, it isn’t the case that

(C1\(_{\textit{Twins}}\))

\(s\) has justification from \(\rE_2\) for \(\rP_2\).

So, (C3\(^{+}\)) is not met either. Since there is no other possibility—either \(s\) has independent justification for \(\rQ_2\) or she doesn’t—it cannot be the case that \(s\)’s belief that \(\rQ_2\) is justified in virtue of her justification for \(\rP_2\) from \(\rE_2\) and her knowledge that \(\rP_2\) entails \(\rQ_2\).

Note that none of the cases of transmission failure of justification considered above entails failure of epistemic closure. For in none of these cases \(s\) has justification for believing \(p, s\) knows that \(p\) entails \(q\), and \(s\) fails to have justification for believing \(q\).

Unsurprisingly, the epistemologists contributing to the literature on transmission failure have principally devoted their attention to cases involving non-transmissive arguments. Epistemologists have endeavored to identify conditions whose satisfaction suffices to make an argument non-transmissive of justification based on a given evidence. The next section reviews the most influential of these proposals.

3.2 Varieties of Non-Transmissive Arguments

Some non-transmissive arguments explicitly feature their conclusion among their premises. Suppose \(p\) is justified for \(s\) by \(e\), and consider the premise-circular argument that deduces \(p\) from itself. This argument cannot satisfy (C3\(^{+}\)) even if (C1) and (C2) are satisfied. The reason is that no part of \(s\)’s justification for \(p\) can be acquired in virtue of, among other things, the satisfaction of (C2). For if (C1) is satisfied, \(p\) is justified for \(s\) by \(e\) independently of \(s\)’s knowledge of \(p\)’s self-entailment, thus not in virtue of (C2).

Non-transmissive arguments are not necessarily premise-circular. A different source of non-transmissivity instantiating a subtler form of circularity is the dependence of evidential relations on background or collateral information. This type of dependence is a rather familiar phenomenon: the boiling of a kettle gives one justification for believing that the temperature of the liquid inside is approximately 100°C only if one knows that the liquid is water and that atmospheric pressure is the one of the sea-level. It doesn’t if one knows that the kettle is on the top of a high mountain, or the liquid is, say, sulfuric acid.

Wright argues, for instance, that the following epistemic set-up, which he calls the information-dependence template, suffices for an argument’s inability to transmit justification.

A body of evidence, \(e\), is an information-dependent justification for a particular proposition \(p\) if whether \(e\) justifies \(p\) depends on what one has by way of collateral information, \(i\). […] Such a relationship is always liable to generate examples of transmission failure: it will do so just when the particular \(e, p\), and \(i\) have the feature that needed elements of the relevant \(i\) are themselves entailed by \(p\) (together perhaps with other warranted premises). In that case, any warrant supplied by \(e\) for \(p\) will not be transmissible to those elements of \(i\). (Wright 2003: 59, edited.)

The claim that \(s\)’s justification from \(e\) for \(p\) requires \(s\) to have background information \(i\) is customarily understood as equivalent (in this context) to the claim that \(s\)’s justification from \(e\) for \(p\) depends on some type of independent justification for believing or accepting \(i\).^[5]

Instantiating the information-dependence template appears sufficient for an argument’s inability to transmit first-time justification. Consider again this triad:

Suppose \(s\)’s background information entails that Jessica and Jocelyn are indistinguishable twins. Imagine that \(s\) acquires \(\rE_2\). It is intuitive that \(\rE_2\) could justify \(\rP_2\) for \(s\) only if \(s\) had independent justification for believing \(\rQ_2\) in the first instance. Thus, Twins instantiates the information-dependence template. Note that \(s\) acquires first-time justification for \(\rQ_2\) in Twins only if

(C1\(_{\textit{Twins}}\))

\(\rE_2\) gives her justification for \(\rP_2\),

(C2\(_{\textit{Twins}}\))

\(s\) knows that \(\rP_2\) entails \(\rQ_2\) and

(C3\(^{\textrm{ft}}_{\textit{Twins}}\))

\(s\) acquires first-time justification for believing \(\rQ_2\) in virtue of (C1\(_{\textit{Twins}}\)) and (C2\(_{\textit{Twins}}\)).

The satisfaction of (C3\(^{\textrm{ft}}_{\textit{Twins}}\)) requires \(s\)’s justification for believing \(\rQ_2\) not to be independent of \(s\)’s justification from \(\rE_2\) for \(\rP_2\). However, if (C1\(_{\textit{Twins}}\)) is true, the informational-dependence template requires \(s\) to have justification for believing \(\rQ_2\) independently of \(s\)’s justification from \(\rE_2\) for \(\rP_2\). Thus, when the information-dependence template is instantiated, (C1\(_{\textit{Twins}}\)) and (C3\(^{\textrm{ft}}_{\textit{Twins}}\)) cannot be satisfied at once. In general, no argument satisfying this template together with a given evidence will be transmissive of first-time justification based on that evidence.

One may wonder whether a deductive argument from \(p\) to \(q\) instantiating the information-dependence template is unable to transmit additional justification for \(q\). The answer seems affirmative when the additional justification is independent justification. Suppose the information-dependence template is instantiated such that \(s\)’s justification for \(p\) from \(e\) depends on \(s\)’s independent justification for \(q\). Note that \(s\) acquires additional independent justification for \(q\) only if

(C1)

\(e\) gives her justification for \(p\),

(C2)

\(s\) knows that \(p\) entails \(q\), and

(C3\(^{\textrm{ai}}\))

\(s\) acquires an additional independent justification in virtue of (C1) and (C2).

This additional justification is independent of \(s\)’s antecedent justification for \(q\) only if, in particular, condition (IN3) of the characterization of additional independent justification is satisfied. (IN3) says that if \(s\) had not been antecedently justified in believing \(q\), upon learning \(e, s\) would have acquired via transmission a first-time justification for believing \(q\). (IN3) entails that if \(q\) were not antecedently justified for \(s, e\) would still justify \(p\) for \(s\). Hence, the satisfaction of (IN3) is incompatible with the instantiation of the information-dependence template, which entails that if \(s\) had not antecedent justification for \(q, e\) would not justify \(p\) for \(s\). The instantiation of the information-dependence template then precludes transmission of independent justification.

As suggested by Wright (2007), the instantiation of the information-dependence template might also appear sufficient for an argument’s inability to transmit additional quantitatively strengthening justification. This claim might appear intuitively plausible: perhaps it is reasonable that if the justification from \(e\) for \(p\) depends on independent justification for another proposition \(q\), the strength of the justification available for \(q\) sets an upper bound to the strength of the justification possibly supplied by \(e\) for \(p\). However, the examples by Wright (2011) and Moretti & Piazza (2013) mentioned in Sect. 2 appear to undermine this intuition. For they involve arguments that instantiate the information-dependent template yet seem to transmit quantitatively strengthening justification to their conclusions. (Alspector-Kelly 2015 suggests that these arguments are a symptom that Wright’s explanation of non-transmissivity is overall inadequate.)

Some authors have attempted Bayesian formalizations of the information dependence template (see the supplement on Bayesian Formalizations of the Information-Dependence Template.) Furthermore, Coliva (2012) has proposed a variant of the same template. In accordance with the information-dependence template, \(s\)’s justification from \(e\) for \(p\) fails to transmit to \(p\)’s consequence \(q\) whenever \(s\)’s possessing that justification for \(p\) requires \(s\)’s independent justification for \(q\). According to Coliva’s variant, \(s\)’s justification from \(e\) for \(p\) fails to transmit to \(q\) whenever \(s\)’s possessing the latter justification for \(p\) requires \(s\)’s independent assumption of \(q\), whether this assumption is justified or not. Pryor (2012: § VII) can be read as pressing objections against Coliva’s template, which are addressed in Coliva (2012).

We have seen that non-transmissivity may depend on premise-circularity or reliance on collateral information. There is at least a third possibility: an argument can be non-transmissive of the justification for its premise(s) based on given evidence because the evidence justifies directly the conclusion—i.e., independently of the argument itself (cf. Davies 2009). In this case the argument instantiates indirectness, for \(s\)’s going through the argument would result in nothing but an indirect (and unneeded) detour for justifying its conclusion. If \(e\) directly justifies \(q\), no part of the justification for \(q\) is based on, among other things, \(s\)’s knowledge of the inferential relation between \(p\) and \(q\). So (C3\(^{+}\)) is unfulfilled whether or not (C1) and (C2) are fulfilled. Here is an example from Wright (2002):

Suppose \(s\) learns evidence \(\rE_6\). On ordinary background information,

(C1\(_{\textit{Socc}}\))

\(\rE_6\) justifies \(\rP_6\) for \(s\),

(C2\(_{\textit{Socc}}\))

\(s\) knows that \(\rP_6\) entails \(\rQ_6\), and \(\rE_6\) also justifies \(\rQ_6\) for \(s\).

It seems false, however, that \(\rQ_6\) is justified for \(s\) in virtue of the satisfaction of (C1\(_{\textit{Socc}}\)) and (C2\(_{\textit{Socc}}\)). Quite the reverse, \(\rQ_6\) seems justified for \(s\) by \(\rE_6\) independently the satisfaction of (C1\(_{\textit{Socc}}\)) and (C2\(_{\textit{Socc}}\)). This is so because in the (imagined) actual scenario it seems true that \(s\) would still possess a justification for \(\rQ_6\) based on \(\rE_6\) even if \(\rE_6\) did not justify \(\rP_6\) for \(s\). In fact suppose \(s\) had noticed that the referee’s assistant raised her flag to signal Jones’s off-side. Against this altered background information, \(\rE_6\) would no longer justify \(\rP_6\) for \(s\) but it would still justify \(\rQ_6\) for \(s\). Thus, Soccer is non-transmissive of the justification depending on \(\rE_6\). In general, no argument instantiating indirectness in relation to some evidence is transmissive of justification based on that evidence.

The information-dependence template and indirectness are diagnostics for a deductive argument’s inability to transmit the justification for its premise(s) \(p\) based on evidence \(e\) to its conclusion \(q\), where \(e\) is conceived of as a believed proposition capable of supplying inferential and (typically) fallible justification for \(p\). (Note that even though \(e\) is conceived of as a belief, the collateral information \(i\), which is part of the template, doesn’t need to be believed on some views.) The justification for a proposition \(p\) might come in other forms. For instance, it has been proposed that a proposition \(p\) about the perceivable environment around the subject \(s\) can be justified by the fact that \(s\) sees that \(p\) (where ‘sees’ is taken to be factive). In this case, \(s\) is claimed to attain a kind of non-inferential and infallible justification for believing \(p\). This view has been explored by epistemological disjunctivists (see for instance McDowell 1982, 1994 and 2008, and Pritchard 2007, 2008, 2009, 2011 and 2012a).

One might find it intuitively plausible that when \(s\) sees that \(p, s\) attains non-inferential and infallible justification for believing \(p\) that doesn’t rely on \(s\)’s background information. Since this justification for believing \(p\) would be a fortiori unconstrained by \(s\)’s independent justification for believing any consequence \(q\) of \(p\), in these cases the information-dependence template could not possibly be instantiated. Therefore, one might be tempted to conclude that when \(s\) sees that \(p, s\) acquires a justification that typically transmits to the propositions that \(s\) knows to be deducible from \(p\) (cf. Wright 2002). Pritchard (2009, 2012a) comes very close to endorsing this view explicitly.

The latter contention has not stayed unchallenged. Suppose one accepts a notion of epistemic justification with internalist resonances saying that a factor \(J\) is relevant to \(s\)’s justification only if \(s\) is able to determine, by reflection alone, whether \(J\) is or is not realized. On this notion, \(s\)’s seeing that \(p\) cannot provide \(s\) with justification for believing \(p\) unless \(s\) can rationally claim that she is seeing that \(p\) upon reflection alone. Seeing that \(p\), however, is subjectively indistinguishable from hallucinating that \(p\), or from being in some other delusional state in which it merely seems to \(s\) that she is seeing that \(p\). Hence, one may find it compelling that \(s\) can claim by reflection alone that she’s seeing that \(p\) only if \(s\) has an independent reason for ruling out that it merely seems to her that she does (cf. Wright 2011). If this is true, for many deductive arguments from \(p\) to \(q, s\) won’t be able to acquire non-inferential and infallible justification for believing \(p\) of the type described by the disjunctivist and transmit it to \(q\). This will happen whenever \(q\) is the logical negation of a proposition ascribing to \(s\) some delusionary mental state in which it merely seems to her that she directly perceives that \(p\).

Wright’s disjunctive template is meant to be a diagnostic of transmission failure of non-inferential justification when epistemic justification is conceived of in the internalist fashion suggested above.^[6] According to Wright (2000), for any propositions \(p, q\) and \(r\) and subject \(s\), the disjunctive template is instantiated whenever:

(D1)

\(p\) entails \(q\);

(D2)

\(s\)’s justification for \(p\) consists in \(s\)’s being in a state subjectively indistinguishable from a state in which \(r\) would be true;

(D3)

\(r\) is incompatible with \(p\);

(D4)

\(r\) would be true if \(q\) were false.

To see how this template works, consider again the following triad:

The justification from \(\rE_3\) for \(\rP_3\) arguably fails to transmit across the inference from \(\rP_3\) to \(\rQ_3\) because of the satisfaction of the information-dependence template. For it seems true that \(s\) could acquire a justification for believing \(\rP_3\) on the basis of \(\rE_3\) only if \(s\) had an independent justification for believing \(\rQ_3\). Now suppose that \(s\)’s justification for \(\rP_3\) is based on, not \(\rE_3\) but \(s\)’s seeing that \(\rP_3\). Let’s call Zebra* the corresponding variant of Zebra. Given the non-inferential nature of the justification considered for \(\rP_3\), Zebra* could not instantiate the information-dependence template. However, it is easy to check that Zebra* instantiates the disjunctive template. To begin with,

(D1\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

\(\rP_3\) entails \(\rQ_3\);

(D2\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

\(s\)’s justification for believing \(\rP_3\) is constituted by \(s\)’s seeing that \(\rP_3\), which is subjectively indistinguishable from the state that \(s\) would be in if it were true that

\(\rR_{\textit{Zebra}}\).

the animals in the pen are mules cleverly disguised to look like zebras;

(D3\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

\(\rR_{\textit{Zebra}}\) is incompatible with \(\rP_3\); and, trivially,

(D4\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

if \(\rQ_3\) were false \(\rR_{\textit{Zebra}}\) would be true.

Since Zebra* instantiates the disjunctive template, it is non-transmissive of at least first-time justification. In fact note that \(s\) acquires first-time justification for \(\rQ_3\) in this case if and only if

(C1\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

\(s\) has justification for \(\rP_3\) based on seeing that \(\rP_3\),

(C2\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

\(s\) knows that \(\rP_3\) entails \(\rQ_3\), and

(C3\(^{\textrm{ft}}_{\textit{Zebra}}\))

\(s\) acquires first-time justification for believing \(\rQ_3\) in virtue of (C1\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\)) and (C2\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\)).

Also note that (C3\(^{\textrm{ft}}_{\textit{Zebra}}\)) requires \(s\)’s justification for believing \(\rQ_3\) not to be independent of \(s\)’s justification for \(\rP_3\) based on seeing that \(\rP_3\). However, if (C1\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\)) is true, the disjunctive template requires \(s\) to have justification for believing \(\rQ_3\) independent of \(s\)’s justification for \(\rP_3\) based on her seeing that \(\rP_3\). (For if \(s\) could not independently exclude that \(\rQ_3\) is false, given (D4), (D3) and (D2), \(s\) could not exclude that the incompatible alternative \(\rR_{\textit{Zebra}}\) to \(\rP_3\), which \(s\) cannot subjectively distinguish from \(\rP_3\) on the ground of her seeing that \(\rP_3\), is true.) Thus, when the disjunctive template is instantiated, (C1\(_{\textit{Zebra}}\)) and (C3\(^{\textrm{ft}}_{\textit{Zebra}}\)) cannot be satisfied at once.

The disjunctive template has been criticized by McLaughlin (2003) on the ground that the template is instantiated whenever the justification for \(p\) is fallible, i.e. compatible with \(p\)’s falsity. Here is an example from Brown (2004). Take this deductive argument:

Suppose \(s\) has a fallible justification for believing \(\rP_7\) based on \(s\)’s experience as if the animal in the garbage is a fox. Take now \(\rR_{\textit{fox}}\) to be \(\rP_7\)’s logical negation. Since the justification that \(s\) has for \(\rP_7\) is fallible, condition (D2) above is met by default. As one can easily check, conditions (D1), (D3), and (D4) are also met. So, Fox instantiates the disjunctive template. Yet it is intuitive that Fox does transmit justification to its conclusion.

One could respond to McLaughlin that his objection is misplaced because the disjunctive template is meant to apply to infallible, and not fallible, justification. A more interesting response to McLaughlin is to refine some condition listed in the disjunctive template to block McLaughlin’s argument while letting this template account for transmission failure of both fallible and infallible justification. Wright (2011) for instance suggests replacing (D3) with the following condition:^[7]

(D3\(^{*}\))

\(r\) is incompatible with some presupposition of the cognitive project of obtaining justification for \(p\) in the relevant fashion.

According to Wright’s (2011) characterization, a presupposition of a cognitive project is any condition such that doubting it before carrying out the project would rationally commit one to doubting the significance or competence of the project irrespective of its outcome.^[8] For a wide class of cognitive projects, examples of these presuppositions include: the normal and proper functioning of the relevant cognitive faculties, the reliability of utilized instruments, the obtaining of the circumstances congenial to the proposed method of investigation, the soundness of relevant principles of inference utilized in developing and collating one’s results, and so on.

With (D3\(^{*}\)) in the place of (D3), Fox no longer instantiates the disjunctive template. For the truth of \(\rR_{\textit{fox}}\), stating that the animal in the garbage is not a fox, appears to jeopardize no presupposition of the cognitive project of obtaining perceptual justification for \(\rP_7\). Thus (D3\(^{*}\)) is not fulfilled. On the other hand, arguments that intuitively don’t transmit do satisfy (D3\(^{*}\)). Take Zebra*. In this case \(\rR_{\textit{fox}}\) states that the animals in the pen are mules cleverly disguised to look like zebras. Since \(\rR_{\textit{fox}}\) entails that conditions are unsuitable for attaining perceptual justification for believing \(\rP_3\), \(\rR_{\textit{fox}}\) looks incompatible with a presupposition of the cognitive project of obtaining perceptual justification for \(\rP_3\). Thus, \(\rR_{\textit{fox}}\) does satisfy (D3\(^{*}\)) in this case.

3.3 Non-Standard Accounts

In this section we outline two interesting branches in the literature on transmission failure of justification and warrant across valid inference. We start with Smith’s (2009) non-standard account of non-transmissivity of justification. Then, we present Alspector-Kelly’s (2015) account of non-transmissivity of Plantinga’s warrant.

According to Smith (2009), epistemic justification requires reliability. \(s\)’s belief that \(p\), held on the basis of \(s\)’s belief that \(e\), is reliable in Smith’s sense just in case in all possible worlds including \(e\) as true and that are as normal (from the perspective of the actual world) as the truth of \(e\) permits, \(p\) is also true. Consider Zebra again.

\(s\)’s belief that \(\rP_3\) is reliable in Smith’s sense when it is based on \(s\)’s belief that \(\rE_3\). (Disguising mules to make them look like zebras is certainly an abnormal practice.) Thus, all possible \(\rE_3\)-worlds that are as normal as the truth of \(\rE_3\) permits aren’t worlds in which the animals in the pen are cleverly disguised mules. Rather, they are \(\rP_3\)-worlds—i.e., worlds in which the animals in the pen are zebras.

Smith describes two ways in which a belief can possess this property of being reliable. One is that a belief that \(p\) has it in virtue of the modal relationship with its basis \(e\). In this case, \(e\) is a contributing reliable basis. Another possibility is when it is the content of the belief that \(p\), rather than the belief’s modal relationship with its basis \(e\), that guarantees by itself the belief’s reliability. In this case, \(e\) is a non-contributing reliable basis. An example of the first kind is \(s\)’s belief that \(\rP_3\), which is reliable because of its modal relationship with \(\rE_3\). There are obviously many sufficiently normal worlds in which \(\rP_3\) is false, but no sufficiently normal world in which \(\rP_3\) is false and \(\rE_3\) true. An example of the second kind is \(s\)’s belief that \(\rQ_3\) as based on \(\rE_3\). It is this belief’s content, and not its modal relationship with \(\rE_3\), that guarantees its reliability. As Smith puts it, there are no sufficiently normal worlds in which \(\rE_3\) is true and \(\rQ_3\) is false, but this is simply because there are no sufficiently normal worlds in which \(\rQ_3\) is false.

According to Smith, a deductive inference from \(p\) to \(q\) fails to transmit to \(q\) justification relative to \(p\)’s basis \(e\), if \(e\) is a contributing reliable basis for believing \(p\) but is a non-contributing reliable basis for believing \(q\). In this case the inference fails to explain \(q\)’s reliability: if \(s\) deduced one proposition from another, she would reliably believe \(q\), but not—not even in part—in virtue of having inferred \(q\) from \(p\) (as held on the basis of \(e)\). Zebra fails to transmit to \(\rQ_3\) justification relative to \(\rP_3\)’s basis \(\rE_3\) in this sense.^[9]

Let’s turn to Alspector-Kelly (2015). As we have seen, Wright’s analysis of failure of warrant transmission interprets the epistemic good whose transmission is in question as, roughly, the same as epistemic justification.^[10] By so doing, Wright departs from Plantinga’s (1993a, 1993b) influential understanding of warrant as the epistemic quality that (whatever it is) suffices to turn true belief into knowledge. One might wonder, however, if there are deductive arguments incapable of transmitting warrant in Plantinga’s sense. (Hereafter we use ‘warrant’ only to refer to Plantinga’s warrant.) Alspector-Kelly answers this question affirmatively contending that certain arguments cannot transmit warrant because the cognitive project of establishing their conclusion via inferring it from their premise is procedurally self-defeating.

Alspector-Kelly follows Wright (2012) in characterizing a cognitive project as a pair of a question and a procedure that one executes to answer the question. An enabling condition of a cognitive project is, for Alspector-Kelly, any proposition such that, unless it is true, one cannot learn the answer to its defining question by executing the procedure associated with it. That a given object \(o\) is illuminated, for example, is an enabling condition of the cognitive project of determining its color by looking at it. For one cannot learn by sight that \(o\) is of a given color unless \(o\) is illuminated.

Enabling conditions can be opaque. An enabling condition of a cognitive project is opaque, relative to some actual or possible result, if it is the case that whenever the execution of the associated procedure yields this result, it would have produced the same result had the condition been unfulfilled. The enabling condition that \(o\) be illuminated of the cognitive project just considered is not opaque, since looking at \(o\) never produces the same response about \(o\)’s color when \(o\) is illuminated and when it isn’t. (In the second case, it produces no response.)

Now consider the cognitive project of establishing by sight whether (\(\rP_3)\) the animals enclosed in the pen are zebras. An enabling condition of this project states that (\(\rQ_3)\) the animals in the pen are not mules disguised to look like zebras. For one couldn’t learn whether \(\rP_3\) is true by looking, if \(\rQ_3\)were true. \(\rQ_3\) is opaque with respect to the possible outcome that \(\rP_3\). In fact, suppose \(\rQ_3\) is satisfied because the pen contains (undisguised) zebras. In this case, looking at them will attest they are zebras, and the execution of the procedure associated with this project will yield the outcome that \(\rP_3\). But this is exactly the outcome that would be generated by the execution of the same procedure if \(\rQ_3\) were not satisfied. In this case too, looking at the animals would produce the response that \(\rP_3\).

We can now elucidate the notion of a procedurally self-defeating cognitive project. The distinguishing feature of any project of this type is that it seeks to answer the question whether an opaque enabling condition—call it ‘\(q\)’—of the project itself is fulfilled. A project of this type has the defect that it necessarily produces the response that \(q\) is fulfilled when \(q\) is unfulfilled. Given this, it is intuitive that it cannot yield warrant to believe \(q\).

As an example of a procedurally self-defeating project, consider trying to answer the question whether your informant is sincere by asking her this very question. Your informant’s being sincere is an enabling condition of the very project you are carrying out. If your informant were not sincere, you couldn’t learn anything from her. This condition is also opaque with respect to the possible response that she is sincere. For your informant would respond that she is sincere both in case she is so and in case she isn’t. Since the execution of this project is guaranteed to yield the result that your informant is sincere when she isn’t, it is intuitive that it cannot yield warrant to believe that the informant is sincere.

Alspector-Kelly contends that arguments like Zebra don’t transmit warrant because the cognitive project of determining inferentially whether their conclusion is true is procedurally self-defeating in the sense advertised. Let’s apply the explanation to Zebra.

Imagine you carry out Zebra. This initially commits you to executing the project of establishing whether \(\rP_3\) by looking. Suppose you get \(\rE_3\) and hence \(\rP_3\) as an outcome. As we have seen, \(\rQ_3\) is an opaque enabling condition relative to the outcome \(\rP_3\) of the cognitive project you have executed. Imagine that now, having received \(\rP_3\) as a response to your first question, you embark in the second project which carrying out Zebra commits you to: establishing whether \(\rQ_3\) is true by inference from \(\rP_3\). This project appears doomed.

\(\rQ_3\) is an enabling condition of the initial project of determining whether \(\rP_3\), which is opaque with respect to the very premise \(\rP_3\). It follows from this that \(\rQ_3\) is also an enabling condition of the second project. For if \(\rQ_3\) were unfulfilled, you couldn’t learn \(\rP_3\) and, a fortiori, you couldn’t learn anything else—\(\rQ_3\) included—by inference from \(\rP_3\). Another consequence is that \(\rQ_3\) is an enabling condition of the second project that is opaque relative to the very outcome that \(\rQ_3\). Suppose first that \(\rQ_3\) is true and that, having visually inspected the pen, you have verified \(\rP_3\). You then execute the inferential procedure associated with the second project and produce the outcome that \(\rQ_3\). Now consider the case in which \(\rQ_3\) is false. Looking into the pen still generates the outcome that \(\rP_3\) is true. Thus, when you execute the procedure associated with the second project, you still infer that \(\rQ_3\) is true. Since you would get the result that \(\rQ_3\) is true even if \(\rQ_3\) were false, the second project is procedurally self-defeating. In conclusion, carrying out Zebra commits you to executing a project that cannot generate warrant for believing its conclusion \(\rQ_3\). This explanation of non-transmissivity generalizes to all structurally similar arguments.

4. Applications

The notions of transmissive and non-transmissive argument, above and beyond being investigated for their own sake, have been put to work in relation to specific philosophical problems and issues. An important problem is whether Moore’s infamous proof of an external world is successful, and whether so are structurally similar Moorean arguments directed against the perceptual skeptic and—more recently—the non-believer. Another issue pertains to the solution of McKinsey paradox. A third issue concerns Boghossian’s (2001, 2003) explanation of our logical knowledge via implicit definitions, criticized as resting on a non-transmissive argument schema (see for instance Ebert 2005 and Jenkins 2008). As the debate focusing on the last topic is only at an early stage of its development, it is preferable to concentrate on the first two, which will be reviewed in respectively Sect. 4.1 and Sect. 4.2 below.

4.1 Moorean Proofs, Perceptual Justification and Religious Justification

Much of the contemporary debate on Moore’s proof of an external world (see Moore 1939) is interwoven with the topic of epistemic transmission and its failure. Moore’s proof can be reconstructed as follows:

Evidence \(\rE_8\) in Moore is constituted by a proposition believed by \(s\). One might suggest, however, that this is a misinterpretation of Moore’s proof (and variants of it that we shall consider shortly). One might argue that what is meant to give \(s\) justification for believing \(\rP_8\) is \(s\)’s experience of a hand. Nevertheless, most of the epistemologists participating in this debate implicitly or explicitly assume that one’s experience as if \(p\) and one’s belief that one has an experience as if \(p\) have the same justifying power (cf. White 2006 and Silins 2007).

Many philosophers find Moore’s proof unsuccessful. Philosophers have proposed explanations of this impression according to which Moore is non-transmissive in some of the senses described in Sect. 3 (see mainly Wright 1985, 2002, 2007 and 2011).^[11] A different explanation is that Moore’s proof does transmit justification but is dialectically ineffective (see mainly Pryor 2004).

According to Wright, there exist cornerstone propositions (or simply cornerstones), where \(c\) is a cornerstone for an area of discourse \(d\) just in case for any proposition \(p\) belonging to \(d, p\) could not be justified for any subject \(s\) if \(s\) had no independent justification for accepting \(c\) (see mainly Wright 2004).^[12] Cornerstones for the area of discourse about perceivable things are for instance the logical negations of skeptical conjectures, such as the proposition that one’s experiences are nothing but one’s hallucinations caused by a Cartesian demon or the Matrix. Wright contends that the conclusion \(\rQ_8\) of Moore is also a cornerstone for the area of discourse about perceivable things. Adapting terminology introduced by Pryor (2004), Wright’s conception of the architecture of perceptual justification thus treats \(\rQ_8\) conservatively with respect to any perceptual hypothesis \(p\): if \(s\) had no independent justification for \(\rQ_8\), no proposition \(e\) describing an apparent perception could supply \(s\) with prima facie justification for any perceptual hypothesis \(p\). It follows from this that Moore instantiates the information-dependence template considered in Sect. 3.2. For \(\rQ_8\) is part of the collateral information which \(s\) needs independent justification for if \(s\) is to receive some justification for \(\rP_8\) from \(\rE_8\). Hence Moore is non-transmissive (see mainly Wright 2002). Note that the thesis that Moore’s proof is epistemologically useless because non-transmissive in this sense is compatible with the claim that by learning \(\rE_8, s\) does acquire a justification for believing \(\rP_8\). For instance, Wright (2004) contends that we all have a special kind of non-evidential justification, which he calls entitlement, for accepting \(\rQ_8\) as well as other cornerstones in general.^[13] So, by learning \(\rE_8\) we do acquire justification for \(\rP_8\). Wright’s analysis of Moore’s proof and Wright’s conservatism have mostly been criticized in conjunction with his theory of entitlement. A presentation of these objections is beyond the scope of this entry. (See however Davies 2004; Pritchard 2005; Jenkins 2007. For a defense of Wright’s views see for instance Neta 2007 and Wright 2014.)

As anticipated, other philosophers contend that Moore’s proof does transmit justification and that its ineffectiveness has a different explanation. An important conception of the architecture of perceptual justification, called dogmatism in Pryor (2000, 2004), embraces a generalized form of liberalism about perceptual justification. This form of liberalism is opposed to Wright’s conservatism, and claims that to have prima facie perceptual justification for believing \(p\) from an apparent perception that \(p, s\) doesn’t need independent justification for believing the negation of skeptical conjectures or non-perceiving hypotheses like \(\notQ_8\). This is so, for the dogmatist, because our experiences give us immediate and prima facie justification for believing their contents. Saying that perceptual justification is immediate is saying that it doesn’t presuppose—not even in part—justification for anything else. Saying that justification is prima facie is saying that it can be defeated by additional evidence. Our perceptual justification would be defeated, for example, by evidence that a relevant non-perceiving hypothesis is true or just as probable as its negation. For instance, \(s\)’s perceptual justification for \(\rP_8\) would be defeated by evidence that \(\notQ_8\) is true, or that \(\rQ_8\) and \(\notQ_8\) are equally probable. On this point the dogmatist and Wright do agree. They disagree on whether \(s\)’s perceptual justification for \(\rP_8\) requires independent justification for believing or accepting \(\rQ_8\). The dogmatist denies that \(s\) needs that independent justification. Thus, according to the dogmatist, Moore’s proof transmits the perceptual justification available for its premise to the conclusion.^[14]

The dogmatist argues (or may argue), however, that Moore’s proof is dialectically flawed (cf. Pryor 2004). The contention is that Moore’s is unsuccessful because it is useless for the purpose to convince the idealist or the external world skeptic that there is an external (material) world. In short, neither the idealist nor the global skeptic believes that there is an external world. Since they don’t believe \(\rQ_8\), they are rationally required to distrust any perceptual evidence offered in favor of \(\rP_8\) in the first instance. For this reason they both will reject Moore’s proof as one based on an unjustified premise.^[15] Moretti (2014) suggests that the dogmatist could alternatively contend that Moore’s proof is non-transmissive because \(s\)’s experience of a hand gives \(s\) immediate justification for believing both the premise \(\rP_8\) and the conclusion \(\rQ_8\) of the proof at once. According to this diagnosis, Moore’s proof is epistemically flawed because it instantiates a variant of indirectness (in which the evidence is an experience of a hand). Pryor’s analysis of Moore’s proof has principally been criticized in conjunction with his liberalism in epistemology of perception. (See Cohen 2002, 2005; Schiffer 2004; Wright 2007; White 2006; Siegel & Silins 2015.)

Some authors (e.g., Wright 2003; Pryor 2004; White 2006; Silins 2007; Neta 2010) have investigated whether certain variants of Moore are transmissive of justification. These arguments start from a premise like \(\rP_8\), describing a (supposed) perceivable state of affairs of the external world, and deduce from it the logical negation of a relevant skeptical conjecture. Consider for example the variant of Moore that starts from \(\rP_8\) and replaces \(\rQ_8\) with:

\(\rQ_8^*\).

It is not the case that I am a handless brain in a vat fed with the hallucination of a hand held up in front of my face.

Let’s call Moore* this variant of Moore. While dogmatists à la Pryor argue that Moore* is transmissive but dialectically flawed (cf. Pryor 2004), conservatives à la Wright contend that it is non-transmissive (cf. Wright 2007). Although it remains very controversial whether or not Moore is transmissive, epistemologists have found some prima facie reason to think that arguments like Moore* are non-transmissive.

An important difference between Moore and Moore* is this: whereas the logical negation of \(\rQ_8\) does not explain the evidential statement \(\rE_8\) (“My experience is in all respects as of a hand held up in front of my face”) adduced in support of \(\rP_8\), the logical negation of \(\rQ_8^*\)—\(\notQ_8^*\)—somewhat explains \(\rE_8\). Since \(\notQ_8^*\) provides a potential explanation of \(\rE_8\), is it intuitive that \(\rE_8\) is evidence (perhaps very week) for believing \(\notQ_8^*\). It is easy to conclude from this that \(s\) cannot acquire justification for believing \(\rQ_8^*\) via transmission through Moore* upon learning \(\rE_8\). For it is intuitive that if this were the case, \(\rE_8\) should count as evidence for \(\rQ_8^*\). But this is impossible: one and the same proposition cannot simultaneously be evidence for a hypothesis and its logical negation. By formalizing intuitions of this type, White (2006) has put forward a simple Bayesian argument to the effect that Moore* and similar variants of Moore are not transmissive of justification.^[16] (See Silins 2007 for discussion. For responses to White, see Weatherson 2007; Kung 2010; Moretti 2015.)

From the above analysis it is easy to conclude that the information-dependence template is satisfied by Moore* and akin proofs. In fact note that if \(\rE_8\) is evidence for both \(\rP_8\) and \(\notQ_8^*\), it seems correct to say that \(s\) can acquire a justification for believing \(\rP_8\) only if \(s\) has independent justification for disbelieving \(\notQ_8^*\) and thus believing \(\rQ_8^*\). Since \(\notQ_8^*\) counts as a non-perceiving hypothesis for Pryor, this gives us a reason to doubt dogmatism (cf. White 2006).^[17]

Coliva (2012, 2015) defends a view—baptized by her moderatism—that aims to be a middle way between Wright’s conservatism and Pryor’s dogmatism. The moderate contends—against the conservative—that cornerstones cannot be justified and that to possess perceptual justification \(s\) needs no justification for accepting any cornerstones. On the other hand, the moderate claims—against the dogmatist—that to possess perceptual justification \(s\) needs to assume (without justification) relevant cornerstones.^[18] By relying on her variant of the information-dependent template described in Sect. 3.2, Coliva concludes that neither Moore nor any proof like Moore* is transmissive. (For a critical discussion of moderatism see Avnur 2017; Baghramian 2017; Millar 2017; Volpe 2017; Coliva 2017.)

Epistemological disjunctivists like McDowell and Pritchard have argued that in paradigmatic cases of perceptual knowledge, what is meant to give \(s\) justification for believing \(\rP_8\) is, not \(\rE_8\), but \(s\)’s factive state of seeing that \(\rP_8\). This seems to have consequences for the question whether Moore* transmits propositional justification. Pritchard explicitly defends the claim that when \(s\) sees that \(\rP_8\), thereby learning that \(\rP_8, s\) can come to know by inference from \(\rP_8\) the negation of any skeptical hypothesis inconsistent with \(\rP_8\), like \(\rQ_8^*\) (cf. Pritchard 2012a: 129–30). This may encourage the belief that, for Pritchard, Moore* can transmit the justification for \(\rP_8\), based on s’s seeing that \(\rP_8\), to \(\rQ_8^*\) (see Lockhart 2018 for an explicit argument to this effect). This claim must however be handled with some care.

As we have seen in Sect. 2, Pritchard contends that when one knows \(p\) on the basis of evidence \(e\), one can know \(p\)’s consequence \(q\) by inference from \(p\) only if \(e\) sufficiently supports \(q\). For Pritchard this condition is met when \(s\)’s support for believing \(\rP_8\) is constituted by \(s\)’s seeing that \(\rP_8, s\)’s epistemic situation is objectively good (i.e., \(s\)’s cognitive faculties are working properly in a cooperative environment) and the skeptical hypothesis ruled out by \(\rQ_8^*\) has not been epistemically motivated. For, in this case, \(s\) has a reflectively accessible factive support for believing \(\rP_8\) that entails—and so sufficiently supports—\(\rQ_8^*\). Thus, in this case, nothing stands in the way of \(s\) competently deducing \(\rQ_8^*\) from \(\rP_8\), thereby coming to know \(\rQ_8^*\) on the basis of \(\rP_8\).

If upon deducing one proposition from another, \(s\) comes to justifiably believe \(\rQ_8^*\) for the first-time, the inference from \(\rP_8\) to \(\rQ_8^*\) presumably transmits doxastic justification. (See the supplement on Transmission of Propositional Justification versus Transmission of Doxastic Justification.) It is more dubious, however, that when \(s\)’s support for \(\rP_8\) is constituted by \(s\)’s seeing that \(\rP_8\), Moore* is also transmissive of propositional justification. For instance, one might contend that Moore* is non-transmissive because it instantiates the disjunctive template described in Sect. 3.2 (cf. Wright 2002). To start with, \(\rP_8\) entails \(\rQ_8^*\), so (D1) is satisfied. Let \(\rR^{*}_{\textit{Moore}}\) be the proposition that this is no hand but \(s\) is victim of a hallucination of a hand held up before her face. Since \(\rR^{*}_{\textit{Moore}}\) would be true if \(\rQ_8^*\) were false, (D4) is also satisfied. Furthermore, take the grounds of \(s\)’s justification for \(\rP_8\) to be \(s\)’s seeing that \(\rP_8\). Since this experience is a state for \(s\) indistinguishable from one in which \(\rR^{*}_{\textit{Moore}}\) is true, (D2) is also satisfied. Finally, it might be argued that the proposition that one is not hallucinating is a presupposition of the cognitive project of learning about one’s environment through perception. It follows that \(\rR^{*}_{\textit{Moore}}\) is incompatible with a presupposition of \(s\)’s cognitive project of learning about one’s environment through perception. Thus (D3\(^{*}\)) appears fulfilled too. So, Moore* won’t transmit the justification that \(s\) has for \(\rP_8\) to \(\rQ_8^*\).

To resist this conclusion, a disjunctivist might insist that Moore*, relative to \(s\)’s support for \(\rP_8\) supplied by \(s\)’s seeing that \(\rP_8\), doesn’t always instantiate the disjunctive template because (D2) isn’t necessarily fulfilled (cf. Lockhart 2018.) By invoking a distinction drawn by Pritchard (2012a), one might contend that (D2) isn’t necessarily fulfilled because \(s\), though unable to introspectively discriminate seeing that \(\rP_8\) from hallucinating it, may have evidence that favors the hypothesis that she is in the first state, which makes the state reflectively accessible. For Pritchard, this happens—as we have seen—when \(s\) sees that \(\rP_8\) in good epistemic conditions and the skeptical conjecture that \(s\) is having a hallucination of a hand hasn’t been epistemically motivated. In this case, \(s\) can come to know \(\rQ_8^*\) by inference from \(\rP_8\) even if she is unable to introspectively discriminate one situation from the other.

Pritchard’s thesis that, in good epistemic conditions, \(s\)’s factive support for believing \(\rP_8\) coinciding with \(s\)’s seeing that \(\rP_8\) is reflectively accessible is controversial (cf. Piazza 2016 and Lockhart 2018). Since this thesis is essential to the contention that Moore* may not instantiate the disjunctive template and may thus be transmissive of propositional justification, the latter contention is also controversial.

So far we have focused on perceptual justification. Now let’s switch to religious justification. Shaw (2019) aims to motivate a view in religious epistemology—he contends that the ‘theist in the street’, though unaware of the traditional arguments for theism, can find independent rational support for believing that God exists through proofs for His existence. These proofs are based on religious experiences and parallel in structure Moore’s proof of an external world interpreted as having the premise supported by an experience.

A Moorean proof for the existence of God is one that deduces a belief that God exists from what Alston (1991) calls a ‘manifestation belief’ (M-belief, for short). An M-belief is a belief based non-inferentially on a corresponding mystical experience. Typical M-beliefs are about God’s acts toward a given subject at a given time: for example, beliefs about God’s bringing comfort to me, reproving me for some wrongdoing, or demonstrating His love for me, and so on. Here is Moorean proof for the existence of God:

Note that the ‘good’ case in which my experience that \(\rP_9\) is veridical has a corresponding, subjectively indistinguishable, ‘bad’ case, in which it only seems to me that \(\rP_9\) because I’m suffering from a delusional religious experience. A concern is, therefore, that God may instantiate the disjunctive template. In this case, my experience as if \(\rP_9\) could actually justify \(\rP_9\) only if I had independent justification for \(\rQ_9\) (cf. Pritchard 2012b). If so, God isn’t transmissive.

Shaw (2019) concedes that God is dialectically ineffective. To defend its transmissivity, he appeals to religious epistemological disjunctivism, which says that an M-belief that \(p\) can enjoy infallible rational support in virtue of one’s pneuming that \(p\), where this mental state is both factive and accessible on reflection. Shaw intends ‘pneuming that \(p\)’ to stand as a kind of religious-perceptual analogue to ‘seeing that \(p\)’ (cf. Shaw 2016, 2019). When it comes to God, my belief that \(\rP_9\) is supposed to be justified by my pneuming that God is comforting me just now. As we have seen in the case of Moore*, a worry is that conceiving of the justification for \(\rP_9\) along epistemological disjunctivist lines may not suffice to exempt God from the charge of instantiating the disjunctive template and being thus non-transmissive.

4.2 McKinsey’s Paradox

McKinsey (1991, 2002, 2003, 2007) has offered a reductio argument for the incompatibility of first-person privileged access to mental content and externalism about mental content. The privileged access thesis roughly says that it is necessarily true that if \(s\) is thinking that \(x\), then \(s\) can in principle know a priori (or in a non-empirical way) that she is thinking that \(x\). Externalism about mental content roughly says that predicates of the form ‘is thinking that \(x\)’—e.g., ‘is thinking that water is wet’—express properties that are wide, in the sense that possession of these properties by \(s\) logically or conceptually implies the existence of relevant contingent objects external to \(s\)’s mind—e.g., water. McKinsey argues that \(s\) may reason along these lines:

Water produces an absurdity. If the privileged access thesis is true, \(s\) knows \(\rP_{10}\) non-empirically. If semantic externalism is true, \(s\) knows \(\rP_{11}\) a priori by conceptual analysis. Since \(\rP_{10}\) and \(\rP_{11}\) do entail \(\rQ_{10}\) and knowledge is presumably closed under known entailment, \(s\) knows \(\rQ_{10}\)—which is an empirical proposition—by simply competently deducing it from \(\rP_{10}\) and \(\rP_{11}\) and without conducting any empirical investigation. Since this is absurd, McKinsey concludes that the privileged access thesis or semantic externalism must be false.

One way to resist McKinsey’s incompatibilist conclusion that the privileged access thesis and externalism about mental content cannot be true together is to argue that Water is non-transmissive. Since knowledge is presumably closed under known entailment, it remains true that \(s\) cannot know \(\rP_{10}\) and \(\rP_{11}\) while failing to know \(\rQ_{10}\). However, McKinsey’s paradox originates from the stronger conclusion—motivated by the claim that Water is a deductively valid argument featuring premises knowable non-empirically—that \(s\), by running Water, could know non-empirically the empirical proposition \(\rQ_{10}\) that she or members of her community have had contact with water. This is precisely what could not happen if Water is non-transmissive: in this case \(s\) couldn’t learn \(\rQ_{10}\) on the basis of her non-empirical justification for \(\rP_{10}\) and \(\rP_{11}\), and her knowledge of the entailment between \(\rP_{10}\), \(\rP_{11}\), and \(\rQ_{10}\) (see mainly Wright 2000, 2003, 2011).^[19]

A first possibility to defend the thesis that Water is non-transmissive is to argue that it instantiates the disjunctive template (considered in Sect. 3.2) (cf. Wright 2000, 2003, 2011). If Water is non-transmissive, \(s\) could acquire a justification for, or knowledge of, \(\rP_{10}\) and \(\rP_{11}\) only if \(s\) had an independent justification for, or knowledge of, \(\rQ_{10}\). (And to avoid the absurd result that McKinsey recoils from, this independent justification should be empirical.) If this diagnosis is correct, one need not deny \(\rP_{10}\) or \(\rP_{11}\) to reject the intuitively false claim that \(s\) could know the empirical proposition \(\rQ_{10}\) in virtue of only non-empirical knowledge.

To substantiate the thesis that Water instantiates the disjunctive template one should first emphasize that the kind of externalism about mental content underlying \(\rP_{10}\) is compatible with the possibility that \(s\) suffers from illusion of content. Were this to happen with \(\rP_{10}, s\) would seem to introspect that she believes that water is wet whereas there is nothing like that content to be believed by \(s\) in the first instance. Consider:

\(\rR_{\textit{water}}\).

‘water’ refers to no natural kind so that there is no content expressed by the sentence ‘water is wet’.

\(s\)’s state of having introspective justification for believing \(\rP_{10}\) is arguably subjectively indistinguishable from a situation in which \(\rR_{\textit{water}}\) is true. Thus condition (D2) of the disjunctive template is met. Moreover, \(\rR_{\textit{water}}\) appears incompatible with an obvious presupposition of \(s\)’s cognitive project of attaining introspective justification for believing \(\rP_{10}\), at least if the content that water is wet embedded in \(\rP_{10}\) is constrained by \(s\) or her linguistic community having being in contact with water. Thus condition (D3\(^{*}\)) is also met. Furthermore, \(\rP_{10}\) entails \(\rQ_{10}\) (when \(\rP_{11}\) is in background information). Hence, condition (D1) is fulfilled. If one could also show that (D4) is satisfied in Water, in the sense that if \(\rQ_{10}\) were false \(\rR_{\textit{water}}\) would be true, one would have shown that the disjunctive template is satisfied by Water. Wright (2000) takes (D4) to be fulfilled and concludes that the disjunctive template is satisfied by Water.

Unfortunately, the claim that (D4) is satisfied in Water cannot easily be vindicated (cf. Wright 2003). Condition (D4) is satisfied in Water only if it is true that if \(s\) (or \(s\)’s linguistic community) had not been embedded in an environment that contains water, the term ‘water’ would have referred to no natural kind. This is true only if the closest possible world \(w\) in which this counterfactual’s antecedent is true is like Boghossian’s (1997) Dry Earth—namely, a world where no one has ever had any contact with any kind of watery stuff, and all apparent contacts with it are always due to multi-sensory hallucination. If \(w\) is not Dry Earth, but Putnam’s Twin Earth, however, the counterfactual turns out false, as in this possible world people usually have contact with some other watery stuff that they call ‘water’. So, in this world ‘water’ refers to a natural kind, though not to H₂O. Since determining which of Dry Earth or Twin Earth is modally closer to the actual world (supposing \(s\) is in the actual world)—and so determining whether (D4) is satisfied in Water—is a potentially elusive task, the claim that Water instantiates the disjunctive template appears less than fully warranted.^[20]

An alternative dissolution of McKinsey paradox—also based on a diagnosis of non-transmissivity—seems to be available if one considers the proposition that

\(\rQ_{11}\).

\(s\) (or \(s\)’s linguistic community) has been embedded in an environment containing some watery substance (cf. Wright 2003 and 2011).

This alternative strategy assumes that \(\rQ_{11}\), rather than \(\rQ_{10}\), is a presupposition of \(s\)’s cognitive project of attaining introspective justification for \(\rP_{10}\).

Even if Water doesn’t instantiate the disjunctive template, a new diagnosis of what’s wrong with McKinsey’s paradox could rest on the claim that the different argument yielded by expanding Water with \(\rQ_{11}\) as conclusion—call it Water*—instantiates the disjunctive template. If \(\rR_{\textit{water}}\) is the same proposition as above, it is easy to see that Water* satisfies conditions (D4), (D2), and (D3\(^{*}\)) of the disjunctive template. Furthermore (D1) is satisfied at least in the sense that it seems a priori that \(\rP_{10}\) via \(\rQ_{10}\) entails \(\rQ_{11}\) (if \(\rP_{11}\) is in background information) (cf. Wright 2011). On this novel diagnosis of non-transmissivity, what would be paradoxical is that \(s\) could earn justification for \(\rQ_{11}\) in virtue of her non-empirical justification for \(\rP_{10}\) and \(\rP_{11}\) and her knowledge of the a priori link from \(\rP_{10}\), \(\rP_{11}\) via \(\rQ_{10}\) to \(\rQ_{11}\). If one follows Wright’s (2003) suggestion^[21] that \(s\) is entitled to accept \(\rQ_{11}\)—namely, the presupposition that there is a watery substance that provides ‘water’ with its extension—Water becomes innocuously transmissive, and the apparent paradox surrounding Water vanishes. This is so at least if one grants that it is a priori that water is the watery stuff of our actual acquaintance, once it is presupposed that there is any watery stuff of our actual acquaintance. For useful criticism of responses of this type to McKinsey’s paradox see Sainsbury (2000), Pritchard (2002), Brown (2003, 2004), McLaughlin (2003), McKinsey (2003), and Kallestrup (2011).

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Other Internet Resources

• Pryor, James, 2007, Uncertainty and undermining, paper manuscript, 19 February 2007.
• Tucker, Chris, 2010b, “Transmission and Transmission Failure in Epistemology”, in the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
• Transmission of Warrant, PhilPapers online research in philosophy.
• Systematic Models of Transmission-Failure, list of papers maintained by Jim Pryor

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