Supplement to Mental Imagery

Mental Imagery Bibliography

This is an extensive, but inevitably incomplete, bibliography of the science and philosophy of mental imagery (it includes the items listed in the selected bibliography on the main entry page). Many, but not all, of the works listed here are cited and discussed in the text of the entry on Mental Imagery, or its supplements. Many items here are annotated, but lack of an annotation should not be taken as an implicit comment on the value or interest of the work in question.

Other works that are cited in the entry, or the supplements, but that themselves say little or nothing directly about imagery, are listed in the Supplementary bibliography of cited works not about mental imagery.

Abell, C. (2005). Review of Zenon Pylyshyn's Seeing and Visualizing: It's Not What You Think. Psyche (11 #1). Available online
Abell, C. & Currie, G. (1999). Internal and External Pictures. Philosophical Psychology (12) 429-445. Mental images and physical pictures may both be regarded as simulations, but of different sorts. Kosslyn's quasi-pictorialism is rejected, and it is argued that the finding of picture-like activation structures in the retinotopic maps in brain during imagery is "not in itself evidence for pictorialism."
Abelson, R.P. (1979). Imagining the Purpose of Imagery. Behavioral & Brain Sciences (2) 548-549.
Agnati, L.F., Guidolin, D., Battistin, L., Pagnoni, G., & Fuxe, K. (2013). The Neurobiology of Imagination: Possible Role of Interaction-Dominant Dynamics and Default Mode Network. Frontiers in Psychology (4 #296). Available onlineA speculative neurobiological theory of imagination and the role of imagery in imagination.
Ahsen, A. (1965). Eidetic Psychotherapy: A Short Introduction. New York: Brandon House.
Ahsen, A. (1977). Eidetics: An Overview. Journal of Mental Imagery (1) 5-38.
Ahsen A. (1984). ISM: The Triple Code Model for Imagery and Psychophysiology. Journal of Mental Imagery (8) 15-42.
Ahsen, A. (1985). Unvividness Paradox. Journal of Mental Imagery (9) 1-18.
Ahsen, A. (1993). Imagery Paradigm: Imaginative Consciousness in the Experimental and Clinical Setting. New York: Brandon House.
Ahsen, A. (1999). Hot and Cold Mental Imagery: Mind over Body Encounters. New York: Brandon House.
Albers, A.M., Kok, P., Toni, I., Dijkerman, H.C., & de Lange, F.P. (2013). Shared Representations for Working Memory and Mental Imagery in Early Visual Cortex. Current Biology (23 #15) 1427-1431. See Tong (2013) for a discussion of the significance of this work.
Albright, T.D. (2012). On the Perception of Probable Things: Neural Substrates of Associative Memory, Imagery, and Perception. Neuron (74 #2) 227-245.
Aleman, A., Van Lee, L., Mantione, M., Verkoijen, I. & De Haan, E. H. D. (2001). Visual Imagery Without Visual Experience: Evidence from Congenitally Totally Blind People. NeuroReport (12) 2601-2604. Evidence suggesting that the congenitally blind can have visual mental imagery; but see Kerr & Domhoff (2004) for critique of such claims.
Altmann, G.T.M. (2004). Language-Mediated Eye Movements in the Absence of a Visual World: The 'Blank Screen Paradigm'. Cognition (93 #2) B79-B87. A study of the eye movements produced when people listen to sentences about pictures they have recently seen. They are very simlar to those made whilst hearing the sentences when actually viewing the pictures, and made just as quickly. Presumably this reflects their imagery of the remembered picture.
Amedi, A. Malach, R., & Pascual-Leone, A. (2005). Negative BOLD Differentiates Visual Imagery and Perception. Neuron (48) 859-872. Non-visual sensory brain areas show reduced activation during visual imagery (but not during visual perception).
Amorim, M.-A., Isableu, B., & Jarraya, M. (2006). Embodied Spatial Transformations: “Body Analogy” for the Mental Rotation of Objects. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (135) 327-347.
Anderson, J.R. (1978). Arguments Concerning Representations for Mental Imagery. Psychological Review (85) 249-77. Argues that the analog vs.propositional (picture vs. description) question is ill posed.
Anderson, J.R. (1979). Further Arguments Concerning Representations for Mental Imagery: A Response to Hayes-Roth and Pylyshyn. Psychological Review (86) 395-406.
Anderson, J.R. (1983). The Architecture of Cognition. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Anderson, J.R. & Bower G.H. (1973). Human Associative Memory. Washington D.C.: Winston/ New York: Wiley. An early critique of Dual Coding Theory from a computational, common coding perspective.
Anderson, K.L., Casey, M.B., Thompson, W.L., Burrage, M.S., Pezaris, E., & Kosslyn, S.M. (2008). Performance on Middle School Geometry Problems With Geometry Clues Matched to Three Different Cognitive Styles. Mind, Brain, and Education (2 #4) 188-197. Both spatial imagery and verbal deductive cognitive styles were found to be important for solving geometry problems, whereas object imagery was not.
Anderson, R.E. (1998). Imagery and Spatial Representation. In W. Bechtel & G. Graham (Eds.) A Companion to Cognitive Science (pp. 204-211). Oxford: Blackwell. Review article.
Andrade, J., Kavanagh, D., & Baddeley, A.D. (1997). Eye-Movements and Visual Imagery: A Working Memory Approach to the Treatment of Post-Traumatic Stress Disorder. British Journal of Clinical Psychology (36) 209-223. Deliberately moving the eyes whilst maintaining a visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness and emotional impact of the image. This suggests that the eye movements observed during visual imagery (see Brandt & Stark (1997), and the other citations given in the comment on that article) play a real causal or constitutive role in imagery, and cannot be dismissed as mere epiphenomena. For further corroboration see: Antrobus et al. (1964); Singer & Antrobus (1965); Sharpley et al., 1996; Kavanagh et al., 2001; van den Hout et al. (2001, 2011); Laeng & Teodorescu (2002); Barrowcliff et al. (2004); Postle et al. (2006); Kemps & Tiggemann, 2007; Lee & Drummond (2008); Gunter & Bodner (2008); Lilley et al., 2009; Jonikaitis et al. (2009); Engelhard et al. (2010, 2011); Hornsveld et al. (2011); and Laeng et al. (2014).
Andrade, J., May J., & Kavanagh, D. (2009). Conscious and Unconscious Processes in Human Desire. Psyche (15 #2). Available online Argues that imagery plays a key role in the psychology of conscious desire. See also Kavanagh et al. (2005).
Angell, J.R. (1906). Psychology: An Introductory Study of the Structure and Function of Human Consciousness (3rd edn.). New York: Henry Holt and Co. Chapter 8, Imagination, gives a useful insight into scientifically informed opinion about imagery in the era of introspectionist psychology, before the rise of Behaviorism. (Angell was J.B. Watson's doctoral advisor.)
Annett, J. (Ed.) (1995). Imagery and Motor Processes. Special issue of the British Journal of Psychology (86 #2).
Annett, J. (1996). On Knowing How to Do Things: A Theory of Motor Imagery. Cognitive Brain Research (3) 65-69. Argues that motor imagery of complex actions (by which we access "knowledge how") involves activation of both action schemata (action prototypes) and perceptual imagery of intermediate stages of the process.
Antonietti, A. (1999). Can Students Predict When Imagery Will Allow Them to Discover the Problem Solution? European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (11) 407-428.
Antonietti, A. & Baldo, S. (1994). Undergraduates' Conceptions of Cognitive Functions of Mental Imagery. Perceptual & Motor Skills (78 #1) 160-162. A questionnaire study. Students tended to believe that imagery is more useful in undirected than in directed thinking, and more useful for representing concrete rather than abstract material.
Antrobus, J.S., Antrobus, J.S., & Singer, J.L. (1964). Eye Movements Accompanying Daydreaming, Visual Imagery, and Thought Suppression. Journal of Abnormal and Social Psychology (69) 244-252.
Arditi, A., Holtzman, J. D., & Kosslyn, S. M. (1988). Mental Imagery and Sensory Experience in Congenital Blindness. Neuropsychologia (26) 1-12.
Arp, R. (2005). Scenario Visualization: One Explanation of Creative Problem Solving. Journal of Consciousness Studies (12, iii) 31-60. Argues, from the standpoint of Evolutionary Psychology and the theory of the modular mind, for the key role of imagery in innovative and creative thought and problem solving.
Arp, R. (2008). Scenario Visualization: An Evolutionary Account of Creative Problem Solving. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Elaborates upon the theory presented in Arp (2005).
Ashwin, P.T. & Tsaloumas, M.D. (2007). Complex Visual Hallucinations (Charles Bonnet Syndrome) in the Hemianopic Visual Field Following Occipital Infarction. Journal of the Neurological Sciences (263) 184-186. An account of hallucinations in the part of the visual field where a patient is blind due to damage to primary visual cortex (V1). This strongly suggests that (contrary to Kosslyn's (1994, 2005; Kosslyn, Thompson, & Ganis, 2006) claims) activation of the retinotopically mapped areas of the brain are not essential to the experience of visual imagery. For further corroboratory evidence see Bridge et al. (2012) and the other material cited in the comment thereto.
Assagioli, R. (1965). Psychosynthesis: A Manual of Principles and Techniques. New York: Hobbs, Dorman & Co. Psychosynthesis was a psychotherapuetic technique originally developed by Assagioli in Italy, in the early 20th century. It made considerable use of mental imagery exercises, and, according to Martin (2007), its introduction into the United States in the 1960s played a significant role in the revival of psychological interest in imagery in that era.
Atwood, G. (1971). An Experimental Study of Visual Imagination and Imagery. Cognitive Psychology (2) 290-299. A demonstration of the selective interference effect in a memory task. For a more methodologically satisfactory demonstration of same, see Janssen (1976a, 1976b).
Audi, R. (1978). The Ontological Status of Mental Images. Inquiry (21) 348-361.
Aveling E. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the Process of Thinking 2. British Journal of Psychology (18) 15-22. A companion piece to Pear (1927) and Bartlett (1927).
Ayers, M. (1986). Are Locke's “Ideas” Images, Intentional Objects or Natural Signs? The Locke Newsletter (17) 3-36. See comment on Ayers (1991).
Ayers, M. (1991). Locke: Epistemology and Ontology (2 volumes). London: Routledge. (Page references are to the single volume edition of 1993.) Argues that the ideas of Locke should be understood to be mental images. For the opposing view see Yolton (e.g., 1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996), Chappell (1994), or Lowe (1995, 2005).
Baars, B.J. (Ed.) (1996a). Special issue on mental imagery of Consciousness and Cognition (5 #3).
Baars, B.J. (1996b). When are Images Conscious? The Curious Disconnection between Imagery and Consciousness in the Scientific Literature. Consciousness and Cognition (5 #3) 261-264. Editor's introduction to the above (Baars, 1996a). The "curious disconnection" that Baars notes, and deplores, in the literature has not been much remedied since, however. This is probably because when the modern discussion about the cognitive science of imagery began, in the 1960s and 1970s, consciousness still remained a largely taboo, little-discussed subject within psychology, cognitive science, and neuroscience. The notorious “imagery debate” (or “analog-propositional debate”) of the 1970s and beyond (see §4.4) was conducted largely without any reference being made to the fact that imagery is consciously experienced (which may go some way toward explaining why the debate still remains unresolved). By the time a modern tradition of scientific research on consciousness began to take off, in the 1990s, and a scientific literature on the subject began to establish itself, the tradition of theorizing and researching imagery without reference to consciousness was already well established, such that, despite Baars’ urgings, the two literatures seemed, to most, to have little to say to one another. Despite the fact that it is, very arguably, of the essence of imagery that it be conscious, discussion the conscious nature of imagery, and of consciousness in general, remains rare in the imagery literature, as does discussion of imagery in the consciousness literature (but see Thomas, 2009).
Baddeley, A.D. (1976). The Psychology of Memory. London: Harper.
Baddeley, A.D. (1994). Working Memory. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Baddeley, A.D. & Andrade, J. (2000). Working Memory and the Vividness of Imagery. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (129 #1) 126-145.
Baddeley, A.D., Grant, S., Wright, E., & Thompson, N. (1975). Imagery and Visual Working Memory. In P.M.A. Rabbit & S. Dornic (Eds.), Attention and Performance 5. London: Academic Press. A demonstration of the selective interference effect (cf. Brooks, 1968).
Baddeley, A.D. & Hitch, G. (1974). Working Memory. In G.H. Bower (Ed.) The Psychology of Learning and Motivation, Vol. 8 (pp.47-89). New York & London: Academic Press.
Baddeley, A.D. & Lieberman, K. (1980). Spatial Working Memory. In R.S. Nickerson (Ed.), Attention and Performance VIII. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. Demonstates the spatial basis of the selective interference effect.
Bain, A. (1880). Mr. Galton's Statistics of Mental Imagery. Mind (5 #20) 564-573. A contemporary commentary on Galton's (1880a) seminal article.
Banks, W.P. (1981). Assessing Relations Between Imagery and Perception. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (7 #4) 844-847. Critiques the claims of Finke & Kurtzman (1981a,b) (and, by implication, all similar claims) to have mapped the "visual field" of mental imagery. See Finke & Kurtzman (1981c) for a response.
Barber, T.X. (1959). The Afterimages of “Hallucinated” and “Imagined” Colors. Journal of Abnormal and Social Psychology (59) 136-139. Experimental demonstration that, in some subjects, negative afterimages may be induced by purely imagined colors.
Barolo, E., Masini, R. & Antonietti, A. (1990) Mental Rotation of Solid Objects and Problem-Solving in Sighted and Blind Subjects. Journal of Mental Imagery (14) 65-74. As well as confirming the occurence of mental rotation in blind subjects, this challenges the empirical claims of Hinton (1979).
Barquero, B. & Logie, R.H. (1999). Imagery Constraints on Quantitative and Qualitative Aspects of Mental Synthesis. European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (11) 315-333.
Barrowcliff, A.L., Gray, N.S., Freeman, T.C.A., & MacCulloch, M.J. (2004). Eye-movements Reduce the Vividness, Emotional Valence and Electrodermal Arousal Associated with Negative Autobiographical Memories. Journal of Forensic Psychiatry & Psychology (15 #2) 325-345. Deliberately moving the eyes while maintaining an unpleasant visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness and emotional impact of the image. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there.
Barsalou, L.W. (1993). Flexibility, Structure, and Linguistic Vagary in Concepts: Manifestations of a Compositional System of Perceptual Symbols. In A. Collins, S. Gathercole, M. Conway, and P. Morris (Eds.), Theories of Memory. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Barsalou, L.W. (1999). Perceptual Symbol Systems (with commentaries and author's reply). Behavioral and Brain Sciences (22) 577-660. Reprint available online Purportedly not directly about imagery, but deals with the closely adjacent topic of mental representations that are inherently perceptual in character, and argues that they are adequate to account for cognition, and explanatorily superior to “amodal” conceptions of representation (such as mentalese) For some recent supporting evidence, that also makes the link with imagery explicit, see Kan et al. (2003), and for some philosophical support see Nyíri (2001) and Prinz (2002).
Barsalou, L.W., & Prinz, J.J. (1997). Mundane Creativity in Perceptual Symbol Systems. In T.B. Ward, S.M. Smith, & J. Vaid (Eds.), Conceptual Structures and Processes: Emergence, Discovery, and Change (pp. 267-307). Washington, DC: American Psychological Association.
Barsalou, L.W., Simmons, W.K., Barbey, A.K., & Wilson, C.D. (2003). Grounding Conceptual Knowledge in Modality Specific Systems. Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7), 84-91.
Bartlett, F.C. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the Process of Thinking. British Journal of Psychology (18) 23-29. A companion piece to Pear (1927) and Aveling (1927).
Bartlett, F.C. (1932). Remembering. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Bartolomeo, P. (2002). The Relationship Between Visual perception and Visual Mental Imagery: A Reappraisal of the Neuropsychological Evidence. Cortex (38) 357-378. Available online Reviews the clinical evidence on deficits in visual mental imagery (and related deficits in visual perception) resulting from brain injury. He concludes that the evidence is not consistent with the Quasi-Pictorial Theory of Kosslyn (1980, 1994), but favors an enactive theory. See also, Bartolomeo & Chokron (2002).
Bartolomeo, P. (2007). Visual Neglect. Current Opinion in Neurology (20) 381-386. Preprint available online A review of current knowledge about unilateral neglect, including imaginal neglect.
Bartolomeo, P. (2008). The Neural Correlates of Visual Mental Imagery: An Ongoing Debate. Cortex (44) 107-108. Preprint available online
Bartolomeo, P., Bachoud-Lévi, A.-C., Azouvi, P., & Chokron, S. (2005). Time to Imagine Space: A Chronometric Exploration of Representational Neglect. Neuropsychologia (43) 1249-57. Available online
Bartolomeo, P., Bachoud-Lévi, A-C., De Gelder, B. Denes, G., G., Dalla Barba, G., Brugieres, P. & Degos, J.-P. (1998). Multiple-Domain Dissociation between Impaired Visual Perception and Preserved Mental Imagery in a Patient with Bilateral Extrastriate Lesions. Neuropsychologia (36) 239-249. Available online Neurological evidence suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early visual areas of the brain. For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Thompson et al. (1995), Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al. (1999). See Kosslyn & Thompson (2003) for further review of this issue and an attempt to reconcile the conflicting findings from neuroimaging studies, but see also Bartolomeo (2002) for more on the neurological evidence.
Bartolomeo, P., Bachoud-Lévi, A-C., & Denes, G. (1997). Preserved Imagery for Colours in a Patient with Cerebral Achromatopsia. Cortex (33) 369-378. Reprint available online See note on previous item.
Bartolomeo, P., Bourgeois, A., Bourlon, C., & Migliaccio, R. (2013). Visual and Motor Mental Imagery After Brain Damage. In S. Lacey & R. Lawson (Eds.). Multisensory Imagery (pp. 249-269). New York: Springer. Argues in favor of an enactive approach to perception and imagery (§13.1.3).
Bartolomeo, P. & Chokron, S. (2001). Levels of Impairment in Unilateral Neglect. In M. Behrmann (Ed.) Handbook of Neuropsychology (2nd edn.), Volume 3: Disorders of Visual Behavior (pp. 67-98). Amsterdam: Elsevier Science. Preprint available online Includes a discussion of imaginal neglect.
Bartolomeo, P. & Chokron, S. (2002). Can We Change our Vantage Point to Explore Imaginal Neglect? Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 184-185. Available online A commentary on Pylyshyn (2002a). Expands on the argument made by Bartolomeo (2002), that the evidence concerning the neurological syndrome of representational neglect (Bisiach & Luzzatti, 1978; Bartolomeo, D'Erme, & Gainotti, 1994) is not consistent with either quasi-pictorial or propositional theories of imagery, but favors enactive theory.
Bartolomeo, P., D'Erme, P., & Gainotti, G. (1994). The Relation between Visuospatial Neglect and Representational Neglect. Neurology (44) 1710-1714. See Bisiach & Luzzatti (1978).
Basso, A., Bisiach, E., & Luzzatti, C. (1980). Loss of Mental Imagery: A Case Study. Neuropsychologia (18) 435-442. Case study of a patient with a mental imagery deficit caused by a brain lesion. See also: Brain (1954); Botez et al. (1985); Goldenberg (1992); Young & van de Wal (1996); Riddoch (1990); Moro et al. (2008); Zeman et al. (2010)..
Baylor, G.W. (1972). A Treatise on the Mind's Eye: An Empirical Investigation of Visual Mental Imagery. Ph.D. thesis, Carnegie-Mellon University, Pittsburgh, PA. (University Microfilms 72-12, 699.) The first serious attempt to simulate imagery computationally. The major inspiration for the description theory of Pylyshyn (1973).
Baylor, G.W. (1973). Modelling the Mind's Eye. In A. Elithorn & D. Jones (Eds.), Artificial and Human Thinking. Amsterdam: Elsevier. A brief sketch of the model detailed in Baylor (1972).
Beaman, C.P. & Williams, T.I. (2010). Earworms ("Stuck Song Syndrome"): Towards a Natural History of Intrusive Thoughts. British Journal of Psychology (101 #4) 637-653. Study of a common form of involuntary auditory imagery.
Beare, J.I. (1906). Greek Theories of Elementary Cognition: From Alcmaeon to Aristotle. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Behrmann, M. (2000). The Mind's Eye Mapped Onto the Brain's Matter. Current Directions in Psychological Science (9) 50-54. A brief review of evidence on neural structures supporting visual mental imagery, from an uncritically quasi-pictorialist perspective.
Behrmann, M., Winocur, G., & Moscovitch, M. (1992). Dissociation Between Mental Imagery and Object Recognition in a Brain-Damaged Patient. Nature (359) 636-637. An account of a brain damaged patient who has visual agnosia (fails to recognize objects normally) but apparently normal imagery ability.
Belardinelli, M.O., Di Matteo, R., Del Gratta, C., De Nicola, A., Ferretti A., Tartaro, A., Bonomo, L., & Romani, G.L. (2004). Intermodal Sensory Image Generation: An fMRI Analysis. European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (16) 729-752. Finds that the left middle-inferior temporal area of the brain is activated by imagery tasks in any sensory modality.
Bennett, M.R. & Hacker, P.M.S. (2003). Philosophical Foundations of Neuroscience. Oxford: Blackwell. The central thesis of this book, strongly influenced by Wittgenstein, is that mental states, processes, characteristics, experiences, etc. are not properly attributed to brains, but, rather, only to whole persons or organisms. In chapter 6, cognitive theories that treat mental images as inner representations, embodied as brain states, are criticized and rejected from this perspective.
Bensafi, M., Porter, J., Pouliot, S., Mainland, J., Johnson, B., Zelano, C., Young, N., Bremner, E., Aframian, D., Kahn, R., & Sobel, N. (2003). Olfactomotor Activity During Imagery Mimics that During Perception. Nature Neuroscience (6) 1142-1144. Provides some direct support for an enactive account (Thomas, 1999b) of olfactory imagery. Analogous to the findings of Brandt & Stark (1997) and Laeng & Teodorescu (2002) on eye movements during visual imagery.
Bensafi, M., Sobel, N., & Khan, R.M. (2007). Hedonic-Specific Activity in Piriform Cortex During Odor Imagery Mimics That During Odor Perception. Journal of Neurophysiology (98 #6) 3254-3262.
Berbaum, K. & Chung, C.S. (1981). Müller-Lyer Illusion Induced by Imagination. Journal of Mental Imagery (5) 125-128. Probably subject to the same objections as the similar work of Wallace (1984) (q.v.). However, Pressey & Wilson (1974) obtained comparable results from what appears to be a better designed experiment.
Bergen, B.K., Lindsay, S., Matlock, T., & Narayanan, S. (2007). Spatial and Linguistic Aspects of Visual Imagery in Sentence Comprehension. Cognitive Science (31) 733-764. Evidence that language comprehension involves the activation of mental imagery of the content of utterances (but at the sentence rather than the word level).
Berger, R.J., Olley, P., & Oswald, I. (1962). The EEG, Eye-Movements and Dreams of the Blind. Quaterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (14) 183-186.
Berger, R.J. & Oswald, I. (1962). Eye Movements During Active and Passive Dreams. Science (137 #3530) 601.
Bergson, H. (1907). Creative Evolution. (Authorized translation from the original French by A. Mitchell: New York: Holt, 1911.) Chapter 4 deals with “the cinematographical mechanism of thought,” Bergson's account of the nature and limitations of image thinking.
Berkeley, G. (1734). A Treatise Concerning the Principles of Human Knowledge. (In M.R. Ayers (Ed.), George Berkeley: Philosophical Works Including the Works on Vision (2nd edn.). London: Dent, 1975.) The ideas of Berkeley's philosophy are, to all intents and purposes, mental images.
Berman, D. (2008). A Confession of Images. Philosophical Practice (3 #2) 255-266. Reprint available online Suggests that individual differences in the vividness of imagery might affect one’s ability to understand, and to give credence to, certain philosophical theories: in particular, Empiricist views about ideas. It is suggested that the differences between Locke, Berkeley and Hume concerning the possibility of general ideas may have arisen from differences in their respective imagery vividness (cf. Fraser, 1891). Berman, however, fails to give due consideration to the many methodological and conceptual difficulties that attend the assessment of individual differences in vividness, and that have led some to doubt whether such differences have any scientific meaning whatsoever (Thomas, 2009; Schwitzgebel, 2002a, 2008, 2011; Chara & Verplanck, 1986; Kaufmann, 1981, 1983; DiVesta, Ingersoll, & Sunshine, 1971; Sheehan & Neisser, 1969). (For the opposing viewpoint, see: McKelvie (1995), Marks (1983a, 1983b, 1989, 1999), and Pearson et al. (2011).) The relative vividness of people’s imagery can only be assessed on the basis of their own introspective reports, and introspective reports (as well as other aspects of performance on psychological tests) are known to be strongly influenced by circumstances and preconceptions (Orne, 1962; Rosenthal, 2002; Rosnow, 2002; and see supplement: The Problem of Demand Characteristics in Imagery Experiments). Thus even if it is true that people’s theoretical opinions about imagery are correlated with what they are inclined to say about the vividness or otherwise of their imagery (and this has not been demonstrated), this might well be because preconceived (folk or formal) theories about imagery influence what people are likely to say about their own imagery experience, rather than because inherent differences in vividness influence people’s theoretical views. Case study evidence (as Berman ought to know!), strongly suggests that, in fact, theoretical views can and sometimes do influence apparently introspectively based claims about imagery in just this sort of way (Thomas, 1989; Berman & Lyons, 2007).
Berman, D. & Lyons, W. (2007). The First Modern Battle for Consciousness: J.B. Watson's Rejection of Mental Images. Journal of Consciousness Studies (14 #11) 5-26. Reaffirms the historical findings of Thomas (1989) (with consideration of a somewhat more extensive range of evidence, and minor differences of interpretation), but, unlike Thomas, does not attempt to draw any conceptual morals from the case. In his early career as a psychologist, John B. Watson strongly insisted that he was introspectively aware of having vivid visual mental imagery, and that it played a functionally important role in his thought processes. However, just a few years later, after he had developed his extremely influential Behavioristic approach to psychology, he began to argue that people do not really experience mental imagery at all.
Berntsen, D. (2009). Involuntary Autobiographical Memories: An Introduction to the Unbidden Past. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Such memories frequently take the form of imagery.
Bértolo, H. (2005). Visual Imagery Without Visual Perception? Psicólogia (26) 173-188. Reprint available online Claims that the congenitally blind can have visual mental imagery; but see Kerr & Domhoff (2004).
Betts, G.H. (1909). The Distribution and Functions of Mental Imagery. New York: Teachers College, Columbia University. A seminal, questionnaire-based investigation of individual differences in imagery vividness and in the frequency of the spontaneous occurence of imagery in thinking. The Betts Questionnaire upon Mental Imagery (QMI) continues to be used in vividness research (although usually as modified and abbreviated by Sheehan (1967)). However, the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973, 1999) is also widely used.
Bexton, W.H., Heron, W., & Scott, T.H. (1954). Effects of Decreased Variation in the Sensory Environment. Canadian Journal of Psychology (8) 70-76. Sensory deprivation discovered to give rise to spontaneous and bizarre imagery.
Bianca, M.L. & Foglia, L. (Eds.) (2006). Mental Imagery and Visual Perception. Special issue of the journal Anthropology & Philosophy (7 #1-2).
Bichowsky, F.R. (1926). The Mechanism of Consciousness: Images. American Journal of Psychology (37) 557-564. A late example of the introspective method in psychology.
Bisiach, E. & Berti, A. (1990). Waking Images and Neural Activity. In R.G. Kunzendorf & A.A. Sheikh (Eds.) The Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery: Theory, Research and Application. Amityville, NY: Baywood.
Bisiach, E., Capitani, E., Luzzatti, C., & Perani, D. (1981). Brain and Conscious Representation of Outside Reality. Neuropsychologia (19) 543-551.
Bisiach, E. & Luzzatti, C. (1978). Unilateral Neglect of Representational Space. Cortex (14) 129-133. The first scientific description of the phenomenon of representational neglect: brain damaged patients who ignore things to their left also ignore the left side in their imagery. Also see the next item, and: Bartolomeo, D'Erme, & Gainotti, (1994), Coslett (1997).
Bisiach, E., Luzzatti, C., & Perani, D. (1979). Unilateral Neglect, Representational Schema and Consciousness. Brain (102) 609-618.
Blachowicz, J. (1997). Analog Representation Beyond Mental Imagery. Journal of Philosophy (94) 55-84.
Blain, P.J. (2006). A Computer Model of Creativity Based on Perceptual Activity Theory. Unpublished doctoral dissertation, Griffith University, Queensland, Australia. Available online Describes a computer simulation of imagery and its role in creativity based on the enactive (perceptual activity) theory of imagery (Thomas, 1999b, 2002; Neisser, 1976), and the closely related sensorimotor/enactive theory of perception (O'Regan & Noë, 2001; Noë, 2004). Blain defends the enactive theory of imagery against a number of potential criticisms, and argues that the successfully implemented computer model proves that it is computationally viable. More recently, Sima (2014; Sima & Freksa, 2012) has developed another computer simulation of enactive imagery theory, one that pays less attention to imagery's role in creativity, but more to the principled simulation of laboratory imagery effects such as those associated with mental scanning, mental reinterpretation, eye movements during imagery, and the neurological condition of representational neglect (see supplement). For an earlier computer simulation model of imagery, based upon Hochberg's (1968) version of enactive theory, see Farley (1974, 1976).
Blakemore, C., Braddick, O., & Gregory, R.L. (1970). Detailed Texture of Eidetic Images: A Discussion. Nature (226) 1267-1268. Questions the reliability of the methodology of the study by Stromeyer & Psotka (1970) on the alleged "super-eidetiker" Elizabeth.
Block, N. (Ed.) (1981a). Imagery. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Widely read collection of philosophical and theoretical pieces concerned with the analog/propositional debate.
Block, N. (Ed.) (1981b). Readings in Philosophy of Psychology, Vol. 2. London: Methuen. Section on imagery adds to and complements the above.
Block, N. (1983a). Mental Pictures and Cognitive Science. Philosophical Review (92) 499-539.
Block, N. (1983b). The Photographic Fallacy and the Debate about Mental Imagery. Noûs (17) 651-661.
Blumenthal, H.J. (1976). Plotinus' Adaptation of Aristotle's Psychology: Sensation, Imagination and Memory. In R.B. Harris (Ed.), The Significance of Neoplatonism (pp. 41-58). Norfolk, VA: International Society for Neoplatonic Studies.
Blumenthal, H.J. (1977-8). Neoplatonic Interpretations of Aristotle on Phantasia. Review of Metaphysics (31) 242-257.
Blumenthal, H.J. (1996). Aristotle and Neoplatonism in Late Antiquity: Interpretations of the De Anima. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Bodner, G.M. & Guay, R.B. (1997). The Purdue Visualization of Rotations Test. The Chemical Educator (2, #4) 1-18.
Bókkon, I. & Mallick, B.N. (2012). Activation of Retinotopic Visual Areas is Central to REM Sleep Associated Dreams: Visual Dreams and Visual Imagery Possibly Co-Emerged in Evolution. Activitas Nervosa Superior (54 #1-2) 10-25. Available online
Boodin, J.E. (1921). Sensation, Imagination and Consciousness. Psychological Review (28) 425-454. Available online
Borst, G. & Kosslyn, S.M. (2008). Visual Mental Imagery and Visual Perception: Structural Equivalence Revealed by Scanning Processes. Memory & Cognition (36) 849-862. doi:10.3758/MC.36.4.849 Borst and Kosslyn 2008 reprint available online
Borst, G., Kosslyn, S.M., & Denis, M. (2006). Different Cognitive Processes in Two Image-Scanning Paradigms. Memory & Cognition (34 #3) 475-490. Although image scanning experiments that rely upon explicit instructions to scan (e.g., Kosslyn, Ball & Reiser, 1978) and those that attempt to induce scanning without explicit instructions (e.g., Finke & Pinker, 1982, 1983) all find a linear relationship between distance and time taken to scan, the actual relationship is distinctly different in the two types of experimental design. This suggests that different mechanisms are in play in each case.
Botez, M.I., Olivier, M., Vezina, J.-L., Botez, T., & Kaufman, B. (1985). Defective Revisualization: Dissociation between Cognitive and Imagistic Thought, Case Study and Short Review of the Literature. Cortex (21) 375-389. Case study of an individual with defective visual mental imagery, apparently due to a congenital brain malformation.
Bourlon, C., Oliviero, B., Wattiez, N., Pouget, P., & Bartolomeo, P. (2011). Visual Mental Imagery: What the Head's Eye Tells the Mind's Eye. Brain Research (1367) 287-297. Another study (among what are now many) showing that spontaneous eye movements made during imagery mimic those made during the perception of similar content. See the comment to Brandt & Stark (1997) for a (possibly incomplete) list of other such findings.
Bousfield ,W.A. & Barry, H.jr. (1933). The Visual Imagery of a Lightning Calculator. American Journal of Psychology (45) 353-359
Bower, G.H. (1970). Imagery as a Relational Organizer in Associative Memory. Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior (9) 529-533.
Bower, G.H. (1972). Mental Imagery and Associative Learning. In L.W. Gregg (Ed.), Cognition in Learning and Memory. New York: Wiley.
Bower, K.J. (1984). Imagery: From Hume to Cognitive Science. Canadian Journal of Philosophy (14) 217-234. Defends the view that mental images are copies of (in the same format as) percepts.
Brain, R. (1954). Loss of Visualization. Proceedings of the Royal Society of Medicine (47) 288-290. Reprint available online Describes two patients who have lost imagery due to brain damage, but have relatively intact perception. See also: Basso et al. (1980); Botez et al. (1985); Goldenberg (1992); Young & van de Wal (1996); Riddoch (1990); Moro et al. (2008); Zeman et al. (2010).
Brandimonte, M.A. & Gerbino, W. (1993). Mental Image Reversal and Verbal Recoding: When Ducks Become Rabbits. Memory and Cognition (21) 23-33.
Brandt, S.A. & Stark, L.W. (1997). Spontaneous Eye Movements During Visual Imagery Reflect the Content of the Visual Scene. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (9) 27-38. Reprint available online Some direct experimental support of a enactive theory of imagery (Hebb, 1968; Neisser, 1976; Thomas, 1999b, 2009). The distinctive pattern of eye movements that a subject makes whilst viewing a particular stimulus scene or pattern is quite closely reenacted by the eye movements that are spontaneously made while recalling the same stimulus via mental imagery. This work has been replicated and extended by Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), Laeng et al. (2014),and Johansson et al. (2005, 2006, 2010, 2012; Johansson, 2013; Johansson & Johansson, 2014). Similar, corroboratory evidence comes from Brandt et al. (1989), Demarais & Cohen (1998), Spivey & Geng (2001), Gbadamosi & Zangemeister (2001), Bensafi et al. (2003), de’Sperati (2003), Humphrey & Underwood (2008), Sima et al. (2010), Bourlon et al. (2011), and Fourtassi et al., (2011, 2013). Recent findings suggesting that eye movements (REMs) during dreaming sleep represent a visual scanning of the dream images, also support the point (Herman et al., 1984; Hong et al., 1997, 2009; Sprenger et al., 2010; Leclair-Visonneau et al., 2010). For evidence that the eye movements made during imagery play a real functional role in producing the imagery (and are not mere epiphenomena of some more basic process), see Andrade et al. (1997) and the citations listed in the comment thereto. For yet further evidence suggesting that visual mental imagery typically involves perceptual enactment at the level of the eye itself, in these cases evidence of relevant movements within the eye, movements of the lens and iris rather than of the eye as a whole, see Ruggieri & Alfieri (1992) and Laeng & Sulutvedt (2013).
Brandt, S.A., Stark, L.W., Hacisalihzade, S., Allen, J., & Tharp, G. (1989). Experimental Evidence for Scanpath Eye Movements During Visual Imagery. In Proceedings of the 11th IEEE Conference on Engineering, Medicine, and Biology, Seattle, WA, 9-12 Nov 1989 (Vol.1, pp. 278-279). New York: IEEE.
Brann, E.T.H. (1991). The World of the Imagination: Sum and Substance. Savage, MD: Rowman & Littlefield. An ambitious philosophical history of conceptions of imagination and imagery, from ancient to contemporary times.
Brébion, G., Ohlsen, R.I., Pilowsky, L.S., & David, A.S. (2008). Visual Hallucinations in Schizophrenia: Confusion Between Imagination and Perception. Neuropsychology (22 #3) 383-389. Evidence in support of the contention that visual hallucinations experienced by schizophrenics are mental images that they fail to adequately distinguish from percepts.
Brett, E.A. & Ostroff, R. (1985). Imagery and Posttraumatic Stress Disorder: An Overview. American Journal of Psychiatry (142) 417-424.
Brewer, W.F. & Schommer-Aikins, M. (2006). Scientists Are Not Deficient in Mental Imagery: Galton Revised. Review of General Psychology (10) 130-146. Galton's own data (1880a, 1883) do not support his oft quoted conclusion that scientists tend to be deficient in imagery (see also, Burbridge, 1994). Neither does a new attempt to replicate his study.
Brewin, C.R., Gregory, J.D., Lipton, M., & Burgess, N. (2010). Intrusive Images in Psychological Disorders: Characteristics, Neural Mechanisms, and Treatment Implications. Psychological Review (117 #1) 210-232.
Bridge, H., Harrold, S., Holmes, E.A., Stokes, M., & Kennard, C. (2012). Vivid Visual Mental Imagery in the Absence of the Primary Visual Cortex. Journal of Neurology (259 #6) 1062-1070. Neurological evidence inconsistent with Kosslyn’s (1994, 2005; Kosslyn, Thompson & Ganis, 2006) claims that visual mental images are instantiated in the retinotopic maps of early visual cortex, in the occipital lobe. These brain areas can be destroyed, leading to full or partial blindness, without imagery being significantly impaired. For similar and related corroboratory neurological findings see: Chatterjee & Southwood (1995); Servos & Goodale, 1995; Goldenberg et al. (1995); Dulin et al. (2008); Zago et al. (2010). Further corroboration of the point comes from the many reports of patients rendered blind in part of their visual field due to damage to the corresponding part of their retinotopically mapped visual cortex, but who nevertheless experience vivid, well formed visual hallucinations (Charles Bonnet syndrome) in precisely those parts of the visual field where they have been blinded: Weiskrantz et al. (1974); Lance, (1976); Kölmel (1985); Ramachandran & Hirstein (1997); Kleiter et al. (2007); Ashwin & Tsaloumas, (2007). (Such visual hallucinations are best interpreted as a form of mental imagery that has escaped volitional control (Thomas, 2014).)
Briscoe R.E. (2011). Mental Imagery and the Varieties of Amodal Perception. Pacific Philosophical Quarterly (92 #2) 153-173. A critical response to Nanay (2010).
Brockmole, J.R., Wang, R.F., & Irwin, D.E. (2002). Temporal Integration Between Visual Images and Visual Percepts. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (28) 315-334.
Brodie, A. (1986-7). Medieval Notions and the Theory of Ideas. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (86) 153-167.
Broerse, J. & Crassini, B. (1980). The Influence of Imagery Ability on Color Aftereffects Produced by Physically Present and Imagined Induction Stimuli. Perception and Psychophysics (28) 560-580. Challenges the results of Finke & Schmidt (1977, 1978).
Broerse, J. & Crassini, B. (1984). Investigations of Perception and Imagery Using CAEs: The Role of Experimental Design and Psychophysical Method. Perception and Psychophysics (35) 155-164. Challenges the results of Finke & Schmidt (1977, 1978).
Brooks, L.R. (1967). The Suppression of Visualization by Reading. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (19) 287-299.
Brooks, L. R. (1968). Spatial and Verbal Components of the Act of Recall. Canadian Journal of Psychology (22) 349-368. The classic demonstration of selective interference between spatial perception and spatial (including visual) imagery. See Hampson & Duffy (1984) for a replication in congenitally blind subjects, and De Beni & Moè (2003) for a more recent study of the effect.
Brown, B.B. (1968). Visual Recall Ability and Eye Movements. Psychophysiology (4) 300-306.
Bruyer, R. & Scailquin, J.C. (1998). The Visuospatial Sketchpad for Mental Images: Testing the Multicomponent Model of Working Memory. Acta Psychologica (98) 17-36.
Budney, A.J., Murphy, S.M., & Woolfolk, R.L. (1994). Imagery and Motor Performance: What Do We Really Know? In A.A. Sheikh & E.R. Korn (Eds.), Imagery in Sports and Physical Performance (pp.97-120). Amityville, NY: Baywood. Skeptical about the value, in sport and athletics, of the widely used technique of mental practice (imaginary practice). For more positive views see Richardson (1967), Ryan & Simons (1982), Paivio (1985), Feltz & Landers (1983), Driskell et al. (1994), Morris et al. (2005), Short et al. (2006), Weinberg (2008).
Bugelski, B.R. (1970). Words and Things and Images. American Psychologist (25) 1002-10012. On imagery effects in verbal learning experiments.
Bugelski, B.R. (1971). The Definition of the Image. In S.J. Segal (Ed.) Imagery: Current Cognitive Approaches. New York: Academic Press.
Bugelski, B.R. (1977). Mnemonics. In International Encyclopedia of Psychiatry, Psychology, Psychoanalysis, and Neurology, Vol. 7. New York: Van Nostrand Reinhold.
Bugelski, (1979). Eidetic Posession: Is Exorcism Necessary? Behavioral and Brain Sciences (2) 598-599. Skeptical as to whether eidetic imagery is a genuine phenomenon. (A commentary on Haber (1979).)
Bugelski, B.R. (1984). Imagery. In R.J. Corsini (Ed.), Encyclopedia of Psychology, Vol. 2 (pp.185-187). New York: Wiley.
Bugelski, B.R., Kidd, E., & Segmen, J. (1968). Image as a Mediator in One Trial Paired Associate Learning. Journal of Experimental Psychology (76) 69-73.
Bundy, M.W. (1927). The Theory of Imagination in Classical and Mediaeval Thought (University of Illinois Studies in Language and Literature. Vol.12). Urbana IL: University of Illinois Press. (Reprinted by Norwood Editions, 1978.) Mainly concerned with imagination from the perspective of aesthetics.
Burbridge, D. (1994). Galton’s 100: An Exploration of Francis Galton’s Imagery Studies. British Journal for the History of Science (27) 443-463. Some of Galton's (1880a, 1883) best known claims about individual differences in imagery, and the lack of imagery, may not be well supported by his actual results (see also, Brewer & Schommer-Aikins, 2006).
Burmann, B., Dehnhardt, G., & Mauck, B. (2005). Visual Information Processing in the Lion-Tailed Macaque (Macaca Silenus): Mental Rotation or Rotational Invariance? Brain, Behavior and Evolution (65 #3), 168-176. Unlike sea lions (Stich et al., 2003), lion-tailed macaques do not appear to use the cognitive strategy of mentally rotating a mental image.
Burton, L.J. & Fogarty, G.J. (2003). The Factor Structure of Visual Imagery and Spatial Abilities. Intelligence (31) 289-318. Evidence that there are multiple dimensions of individual differences in imagery ability.
Calì, C. (2005). Husserl and the Phenomenological Description of Imagery: Some Issues for the Cognitive Sciences? Arhe (2 #4) 25-37.
Calkins, M.W. (Ed.) (1963). The Metaphysical System of Hobbes. La Salle, IL: Open Court. Contains translated extracts from the Latin works in which Hobbes discusses cognition in general and imagery in particular. However, not a great deal is added to the account to be found in Leviathan (Hobbes, 1651).
Cameron, A. (1897). The Imagery of One Early Made Blind. Psychological Review (4 #4) 391-392. An account of his visual imagery experience by an adult who became blind just after the age of five. He recalls several visual memories from before he lost his sight, and discusses his conceptions of space, infinity, and geometrical figures.
Campos, A. (2014). Gender Differences in Imagery. Personality and Individual Differences (59) 107-111. No significant differences in terms of subjective imagery vividness were found between men and women, although (as other studies have found) men tend to perform slightly better than women on tests of spatial cognition such as mental rotation tasks.
Campos, A., Chiva, M., & Moreau, M. (2000). Alexithymia and Mental Imagery. Personality and Individual Differences (29 #5) 787-791. It is thought that there might be an association between experiencing little or no (or very weak, unvivid) mental imagery and alexithymia, a psychological condition in which people have a very poor understanding of their emotions, and are unable to articulate their feelings normally. This article explores the possible connection, using the VVIQ questionnaire (Marks, 1973) to assess individual differences in imagery.
Candlish, S. (1975). Mental Images and Pictorial Properties. Mind (84) 260-262. A critique of Hannay's (1971) defense of pictorialism.
Candlish, S. (1976). The Incompatibility of Perception and Imagery: A Contemporary Orthodoxy. American Philosophical Quarterly (13) 63-68. Stewart Candlish informs me that the title of this article was misprinted in the published version. The title given here is the one he intended.
Candlish, S. (2001). Mental Imagery. In S. Schroeder (Ed.), Wittgenstein and Contemporary Philosophy of Mind. London: Palgrave. Discusses Wittgenstein's views on imagery, and their influence.
Caplan, H. (1930). Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola: On the Imagination: The Latin Text with an Introduction, an English Translation, and Notes. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press. (Original Latin, c. 1500 A.D.) Gianfrancesco should not be confused with his uncle, also a philosopher, Giovanni Pico della Mirandola.
Carpenter, P.A. & Eisenberg, P. (1978). Mental Rotation and the Frame of Reference in Blind and Sighted Individuals. Perception and Psychophysics (23) 117-124. Mental rotation effect (Shepard & Cooper, 1982) demonstrated in congenitally blind subjects using tactile stimuli (cf. Marmor & Zaback, 1976; and see also: Jonides, Kahn, & Rozin, 1975; Kerr, 1983; Zimler & Keenan, 1983).
Carpenter, P.A. & Just, M.A. (1978). Eye Fixations During Mental Rotation. In J.W. Senders, D.F. Fisher, & R.A. Monty (Eds.), Eye Movements and the Higher Psychological Functions (pp. 115-133). Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. A study of the Shepard & Metzler (1971) mental rotation task. See also Just & Carpenter (1976).
Carrasco, M. & Ridout, J.B. (1993). Olfactory Perception and Olfactory Imagery: A multidimensional analysis. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (19) 287-301.
Carruthers, M.J. (1990). The Book of Memory: A Study of Memory in Medieval Culture. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Discusses the mnemonic techniques (mostly imagery based) that were in wide use in medieval times, and considers their effect on medieval intellectual culture in general (see also: Yates, 1966; Carruthers, 1998; Rossi, 2000).
Carruthers, M.J. (1998). The Craft of Thought: Meditation, Rhetoric, and the Making of Images, 400-1200. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Casey, E.S. (1971). Imagination: Imagining and the Image. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (31) 475-90.
Casey, E.S. (1976). Imagining: A Phenomenological Study. Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
Casey, E.S. (1977-8). Imagining and Remembering. Review of Metaphysics (31) 187-209.
Caston, V. (1996). Why Aristotle Needs Imagination. Phronesis (41) 20-55.
Cattaneo, Z., Vecchi, T., Cornoldi, C., Mammarella, I., Bonino, D., Ricciardi, E., & Pietrini, P. (2008). Imagery and Spatial Processes in Blindness and Visual Impairment. Neuroscience and Biobehavioral Reviews (32 #8) 1346-1360.
Cave, K., Pinker, S., Giorgi, L., Thomas, C.E., Heller, L.M., Wolfe, J.M., & Lin, H. (1994). The Representation of Location in Visual Images. Cognitive Psychology (26) 1-32.
Chambers, D. (1993). Images are Both Depictive and Descriptive. In B. Roskos-Ewoldsen, M.J. Intons-Peterson & R.E. Anderson (Eds.), Imagery, Creativity and Discovery: A Cognitive Perspective (pp. 77-97). Amsterdam: Elsevier.
Chambers, D. & Reisberg, D. (1985). Can Mental Images be Ambiguous? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (11) 317-328. A very striking experiment; but see Peterson et al. (1992), Rollins (1994), Cornoldi et al, (1996), Slezak (1991, 1995), and other listed works by Chambers and/or Reisberg for related (and often conflicting) experimental results, and competing interpretations.
Chambers, D. & Reisberg, D. (1992). What an Image Depicts Depends on What an Image Means: An Image of a Duck Does Not Include a Rabbit's Nose. Cognitive Psychology (24) 145-174.
Chappell, V. (1994). Locke's Theory of Ideas. In V. Chappell (Ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Locke (pp. 26-55). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Argues that the ideas of Locke should not be understood to be mental images (see also Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996), and Lowe (1995, 2005)). For the opposing view see Ayers (1986, 1991), White (1990), or Price (1953).
Chara, P.J.jr. & Verplanck, W.S. (1986). The Imagery Questionnaire: An Investigation of its Validity. Perceptual and Motor Skills (63) 915-920. Preprint available online Calls the validity of the VVIQ (Marks, 1973, 1999) into question. See also: Marks (1983a, 1983b, 1989, 1999), Kaufmann (1981, 1983), McKelvie (1995), Schwitzgebel (2002a), Dean & Morris (2003).
Chatterjee, A. & Southwood, M. H. (1995). Cortical Blindness and Visual Imagery. Neurology (45) 2189-2195.
Chisholm, R.M. (1942). The Problem of the Speckled Hen. Mind (51) 368-373.
Chokron, S., Colliot, P., & Bartolomeo, P. (2004). The Role of Vision in Spatial Representation. Cortex (40) 281-290. Reprint available online
Cincotta, M., Tozzi, F., Zaccara, G., Borgheresi, A., Lori, S., Cosottini, M., & Cantello, R. (1999). Motor Imagery in a Locked-in Patient: Evidence from Transcranial Magnetic Stimulation. Italian Journal of Neurological Science (20) 37-41.
Clark, H. (1916). Visual Imagery and Attention: An Analytical Study. American Journal of Psychology (27) 461-492. An early study on eye movements and during visual mental imagery.
Clark, J.M. & Paivio, A. (1989). Observational and Theoretical Terms in Psychology: A Cognitive Perspective on Scientific Language. American Psychologist (44) 500-512. Attempts to apply Dual Coding Theory (Paivio, 1971) to an issue in the philosophy of science.
Cocking, J.M. (1991). Imagination: A Study in the History of Ideas. London: Routledge.
Cohen, J. (1996). The Imagery Debate: A Critical Assessment. Journal of Philosophical Research (21) 149-182.
Cohen, M.S., Kosslyn, S.M., Breiter, H.C., DiGirolamo, G.J., Thompson, W.L., Anderson, A.K., Bookheimer, S.Y., Rosen, B.R., & Belliveau, J.W. (1996). Changes in Cortical Activity During Mental Rotation: A Mapping Study Using Functional MRI. Brain (119) 89-100.
Collins, C. (1991). The Poetics of the Mind's Eye: Literature and the Psychology of Imagination. Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press. Attempts to apply theories and findings from the cognitive psychology of mental imagery to literary issues. For other attempts to do likewise (in various ways), see Esrock (1994), Scarry (1995, 1999), Zitlow (2000), Troscianko (2010, 2013).
Coltheart, M. & Glick, M.J. (1974). Visual Imagery: A Case Study. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (26) 438-453. Case study of a single subject with unusual imagery abilities.
Conrad, J., Shah, A.H., Divino, C.M., Schluender, S., Gurland, B., Shlasko, E., & Szold, A. (2006). The Role of Mental Rotation and Memory Scanning in the Performance of Laparoscopic Skills. Surgical Endoscopy and Other Interventional Techniques (20) 504-510.
Cook, P. & Wilson, M. (2010). Do Young Chimpanzees Have Extraordinary Working Memory? Psychonomic Bulletin & Review (17 #4) 599-600. A skeptical rebuttal of the claim by Inoue & Matsuzawa (2007) to have found evidence for eidetic imagery in chimpanzees.
Cooper, L.A. (1975). Mental Rotation of Random Two Dimensional Shapes. Cognitive Psychology (7) 20-43. (Reprinted as chapter 5 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Cooper, L.A. (1976). Demonstration of a Mental Analog of an External Rotation. Perception and Psychophysics (19) 296-302 (Reprinted as chap.7 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Cooper, L.A. (1995). Varieties of Visual Representation: How Are We to Analyze the Concept of Mental Image? Neuropsychologia (33) 1575-1582. Reflections on the history of imagery research and findings concerning the neuroscience of imagery. Argues that imagery may not be a unitary cognitive function.
Cooper, L.A. & Shepard, R.N. (1973). Chronometric Studies of the Rotation of Mental Images. In W.G. Chase (Ed.), Visual Information Processing (pp. 75-176).New York: Academic Press. (Reprinted as chapter 4 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Cooper, L.A. & Shepard, R.N. (1975). Mental Transformations in the Identification of Left and Right Hands. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (1) 48-56. (Reprinted as chapter 10 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Cornoldi, C., Calore, D. & Pra-Baldi, A. (1979) Imagery Ratings and Recall in Congenitally Blind Subjects. Perceptual and Motor Skills (48) 627-639.
Cornoldi, C., Logie, R.H., Brandimonte, M.A., Kaufmann, G., & Reisberg, D. (1996). Stretching the Imagination: Representation and Transformation in Mental Imagery. Oxford: Oxford University Press. See note at Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Cornoldi, C. & McDaniel, M.A. (Eds.) (1991). Imagery and Cognition. New York: Springer-Verlag.
Coslett, H.B. (1997). Neglect in Vision and Visual Imagery: A Double Dissociation. Brain (120) 1163-1171. See note at Bisiach & Luzzatti (1978).
Cottingham, J., Stoothoff, R., Murdoch, D., & Kenny, A. (Trans. & Eds.) (1991). The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol.III: The Correspondence. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Courbois, Y. & Coello, Y. (2004). Mental Imagery Abilities in Adolescents with Spastic Diplegic Cerebral Palsy. Journal of Intellectual & Developmental Disability (29 #3) 1-13. Adolescents with cerebral palsy performed normally on imagery tasks (image generation, maintainance, scanning, and rotation) unless they also had perceptual deficits (which is quite often the case). Then they performed more slowly, but equally accurately.
Craig, E. M. (1973). Role of Mental Imagery in Free Recall of Deaf, Blind and Normal Subjects. Journal of Experimental Psychology (97) 249-253.
Crammond, D.J. (1997). Motor Imagery: Never in Your Wildest Dreams. Trends in Neuroscience (20-2) 54-57.
Crapo, A.W., Waisel, L.B., Wallace, W.A., & Willemain, T.R. (2000). Visualization and the Process of Modeling: A Cognitive-Theoretic View. In R. Ramakrishnan, S. Stolfo. R. Bayardo & I. Parsa (Eds.). Proceedings of the Sixth ACM SIGKDD International Conference on Knowledge Discovery and Data Mining (pp. 218-226). New York: ACM Press. The respective roles of mental images and explicit diagrams in discovering and understanding relationships in data mining, and in developing and assessing computational models for very large, high dimensional data sets.
Craver-Lemley, C. & Arterberry, M.E. (2001). Imagery-induced Interference on a Visual Detection Task. Spatial Vision (14 #2) 101-119. The so called "Perky effect," whereby maintaining a visual mental image in consciousness leads (in many circumstances) to a decrement in visual performance.
Craver-Lemley, C. & Reeves, A. (1992). How Visual Imagery Interferes With Vision. Psychological Review (99) 633-649. The so called "Perky effect," whereby maintaining an image in consciousness leads (in most circumstances) to a decrement in visual performance. Perky's original (1910) experiment is often interpreted as showing that, in at least some cases, mental images and percepts are subjectively indistinguishable. This work suggests an alternative explanation for Perky's findings: that maintaining an image in mind may prevent people from consciously seeing very faint visual stimuli.
Creem, S.H., Downs, T.H., Wraga, M., Harrington, G.S., Proffitt, D.R., & Downs, J.H. III (2001). An fMRI Study of Imagined Self-rotation. Cognitive, Affective, & Behavioral Neuroscience (1 #3) 239-249. The most significant area of activation was left posterior parietal cortex. In some subjects, secondary visual, premotor, and frontal lobe regions were also activated.
Crowther, P. (2013). How Images Create Us: Imagination and the Unity of Self-Consciousness. Journal of Consciousness Studies ( 20 #11-12) 101-123. A non-deflationary philosophical account of the nature of imagination as an image (both mental and physical) making faculty, with particular reference to its role in the creation and appreciation of visual art and the role it plays in our broader consciousness and self-creation.
Cui, X., Jeter, C.B., Yang, D., Montague, P.R., & Eagleman, D.M. (2007). Vividness of Mental Imagery: Individual Variability Can Be Measured Objectively. Vision Research (47) 474-478. Activity level in early visual cortex (areas 17 & 18) as measured by fMRI during an imagery task was found to correlate positively with people's self reports of imagery vividness (as measured by the VVIQ); also, performance on a color naming task was found to be negatively correlated with VVIQ vividness. (However, other studies have failed to find any correlation between fMRI measures of cortical activity during imagery and VVIQ scores: Ganis, Thompson, & Kosslyn (2004); Schienle et al. (2008).)
Currie, G. (1995). Visual Imagery as the Simulation of Vision. Mind and Language (10) 25-44.
Currie, G. (2000). Imagination, Delusion and Hallucinations. Mind and Language (15) 168-183.
Currie, G. & Jones N. (2006). McGinn on Delusion and Imagination. Philosophical Books (47) 306-313. Essay review of McGinn's Mindsight (2004). See McGinn (2006) for reply.
Currie, G. & Ravenscroft, I. (1997). Mental Simulation and Motor Imagery. Philosophy of Science (64) 161-180.
Damasio, A.R. (1994). Descartes' Error: Emotion, Reason, and the Human Brain. New York: Putnam.
Damasio, A.R. (2003). Looking for Spinoza: Joy, Sorrow, and the Feeling Brain. New York: Harcourt.
Damasio, A.R. & Damasio, H. (1996) Making Images and Creating Subjectivity. In R. Llinás & P.S. Churchland (Eds.), The Mind-Brain Continuum: Sensory Processes (pp. 19-27). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Danto, A.C. (1958). Concerning Mental Pictures. Journal of Philosophy (55) 12-20.
Daston, L. (1998). Fear and Loathing of the Imagination in Science. Dædalus (127-1) 73-95.
De Beni, R. & Cornoldi, C. (1988). Imagery Limitations in Totally Congenitally Blind Subjects. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (14) 650-655.
De Beni, R. & Moè, A. (2003). Imagery and rehearsal as study strategies for written or orally presented passages. Psychonomic Bulletin & Review (10) 975-980. A recent study of the selective interference effect. Cf. Brooks (1967, 1968).
de Hevia, M.D., Vallar, G., & Girelli, L. (2008). Visualizing Numbers in the Mind's Eye: The Role of Visuo-spatial Processes in Numerical Abilities. Neuroscience and Biobehavioral Reviews (32) 1361-1372.
De Preester, H. (2012). The Sensory Component of Imagination: The Motor Theory of Imagination as a Present-Day Solution to Sartre's Critique. Philosophical Psychology (25 #4) 503-520. Argues that an enactive or “motor” theory of imagination (specifically that of Thomas (1999b)) coheres with and justifies the arguments and claims made about the imagination by phenomenologists such as Husserl and Sartre.
De Volder, A.G., Toyama, H., Kimura, Y., Kiyosawa, M., Nakano, H., Vanlierde, A., Wanet-Defalque, M.-C., Mishina, M., Oda, K., Ishiwata, K., & Senda, M. (2001). Auditory Triggered Mental Imagery of Shape Involves Visual Association Areas in Early Blind Humans. NeuroImage (14) 129-139. See Lambert et al. (2004) for more on the neuroscience of imagery in the congenitally blind.
Dean, G.M. & Morris, P.E. (2003). The Relationship Between Self-reports of Imagery and Spatial Ability. British Journal of Psychology (94) 245–273. Although imagery vividness (VVIQ score) does not correlate with spatial thinking ability, other, more fine grained introspectively based measures of a person's conscious imagery do appear to be correlated with spatial ability.
Deckert, G.H. (1964). Pursuit Eye Movements in the Absence of a Moving Visual Stimulus. Science (143) 1192-1193.
Degenaar, J. (2014). Through the Inverting Glass: First-person Observations on Spatial Vision and Imagery. Phenomenology and the Cognitive Sciences (13 #2) 373-393. A first-person account, by a philosopher, of the experience of wearing and adapting to “inverting glasses” (that invert the retinal image), over many days. The process of adaptation, it is claimed, is experienced as a much more complex matter than an upside-down world turning right-side-up again. Effects are reported not only upon the subjective experience of visual perception, but also upon mental imagery. The findings are theorized in terms of the sensorimotor/enactive theory of perception and imagery.
Degenaar, J. & Myin, E. (2014). Representation-Hunger Reconsidered. Synthese 1-10, doi:10.1007/s11229-014-0484-4 Argues that cognition in general (and imagery in particular) can be explained without making appeal to representations (in the sense of inner vehicles of specific contents).
Delius, J.D. & Hollard, V.D. (1995). Orientation Invariant Pattern Recognition by Pigeons (Columba Livia) and Humans (Homo Sapiens). Journal of Comparative Psychology (109 #3) 278-290. Unlike humans, pigeons do not appear to use a mental rotation strategy when comparing similar shapes at different orientations. (In fact, they appear to use a more efficient strategy.) This confirms the findings of Hollard & Delius (1982). However, see Rilling & Neiworth (1991) for a different view.
Della Sala, S., Logie, R.H., Beschin, N., & Denis, M. (2004). Preserved Visuo-Spatial Transformations in Representational Neglect. Neuropsychologia (42) 1358-1364.
Demarais, A.M & Cohen, B.H. (1998). Evidence for Image-Scanning Eye Movements during Transitive Inference. Biological Psychology (49) 229-247. Eye movements during imagery re-enact those that would be expected during perception of a similar scene. This lends support to the enactive theory of imagery (Hebb, 1968; Hochberg, 1968; Sarbin & Juhasz, 1970; Neisser, 1976; Thomas, 1999b). For further evidence for re-enactive perceptual behavior during imagery see: Brandt & Stark (1997), Spivey & Geng (2001), Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), Johansson et al. (2005, 2006), Bensafi et al. (2003), de’Sperati (2003), and Hong et al. (1997).
Dement, W.C. & Kleitman, N. (1957). The Relation of Eye Movements During Sleep to Dream Activity: An Objective Method for the Study of Dreaming. Journal of Experimental Psychology (53) 339-346.
Dement, W. & Wolpert, E.A. (1958). The Relation of Eye Movements, Body Motility, and External Stimuli to Dream Content. Journal of Experimental Psychology (55 #6) 543-553.
Denis, M. (1991). Image and Cognition. Hemel Hempstead, U.K.: Harvester Wheatsheaf. (Original French, 1989. English translation by the author and C. Greenbaum.) Useful survey.
Denis, M. & Carfantan, M. (1985). People's Knowledge About Images. Cognition (20) 49-60. An empirical study of the folk psychology of imagery.
Denis, M., Engelkamp, J., & Richardson, J.T.E. (Eds.) (1988). Cognitive and Neuropsychological Approaches to Mental Imagery. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Martinus Nijhoff.
Denis, M., Logie, R.H., Cornoldi, C., De Vega, M. & Engelkamp, J. (Eds.) (2001). Imagery, Language, and Visuo-Spatial Thinking. Hove, U.K.: Psychology Press.
Denis, M., Mellet, E., & Kosslyn, S.M. (Eds.) (2004). Neuroimaging of Mental Imagery. Special issue of the European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (vol. 16, No. 5, September 2004).
Dennett, D.C. (1969). Content and Consciousness. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. Argues that the inherent vagueness of images suggests that they are more like descriptions than pictures. (A similar argument is made by Shorter (1952).) Dennett's arguments have been much discussed, but generally rejected (Hannay, 1971; Fodor,1975; Shepard; 1978b; Block,1981a, 1983b; Lyons, 1984; Tye, 1991).
Dennett, D.C. (1978). Brainstorms. Montgomery, VT: Bradford Books. Chapter 10, “Two Approaches to Mental Images,” is especially relevant .
Dennett, D.C. (1991). Consciousness Explained. Boston, MA: Little, Brown. Chapter 10 attempts to integrate Kosslyn's quasi-pictorial theory of imagery into Dennett's philosophical framework.
Dennett, D.C. (2002). Does Your Brain Use the Images in It, and If So, How? Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 189-190.
Descartes, R. (1637). Optics. (Translated from the French by R. Stoothoff, in J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff & D. Murdoch (Trans. & Eds.), The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol. 1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.)
Descartes, R. (1648). Conversation with Burman. (Edited and translated into English by J. Cottingham. Oxford, Oxford University Press, 1976.)
Descartes, R. (1649). The Passions of the Soul. (Translated from the French by R. Stoothoff, in J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff & D. Murdoch (Trans. & Eds.), The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol.1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.)
Descartes, R. (1664). L'Homme (Treatise of Man). (Facsimile of the original French, together with an English translation by T.S. Hall: Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1972. An abridged translation, by R. Stoothoff, is also available in J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff & D. Murdoch (Trans. & Eds.), The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, Vol.1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1985.) Descartes' seminal mechanical theory of human physiology, including mechanistic accounts of perception, memory, emotion, and imagination. The work is thought to have been written in or before 1633, but was not published until 1664.
Deschaumes-Molinaro, C., Dittmar, A., & Vernet-Maury, E. (1992). Autonomic Nervous System Response Patterns Correlate with Mental Imagery. Physiology and Behavior (51) 1021-1027.
de’Sperati, C. (2003). Precise Oculomotor Correlates of Visuospatial Mental Rotation and Circular Motion Imagery. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (15) 1244-1259. Cf. Brandt & Stark (1997), Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), and Johansson et al. (2005, 2006).
de’Sperati, C. & Santandrea, E. (2005). Smooth Pursuit-like Eye Movements During Mental Extrapolation of Motion: The Facilitatory Effect of Drowsiness. Cognitive Brain Research (25 #1) 328-338. Smooth pursuit eye movements, like those produced when visually following a moving object, observed when the subject is merely imagining the moving object. However, this only happened when the subject was drowsy. In non-drowsy subject the imagined moving stimulus is followed by a sequence of saccade-like eye movements instead (see de’Sperati, 2003).
D’Esposito, M., Detre, J.A., Aguirre, G.K., Stallcup, M., Alsop, D.C., Tippet, L.J., & Farah, M.J. (1997). A Functional MRI Study of Mental Image Generation. Neuropsychologia (35) 725-730. Finds that visual association cortex, but not primary visual cortex, is activated during visual mental imagery. (See Bartolomeo (2002) and Kosslyn & Thompson (2003) for review of the issue.)
Deutsch, M. (1981). Imagery and Inference in Physical Research. In Tweney, R. D., Doherty, M. E., & Mynatt, C. R. (Eds.), On Scientific Thinking (pp. 354-360). New York: Columbia University Press. (Extract from original work of 1959.)
Dietrich, A. (2008). Imaging the Imagination: The Trouble with Motor Imagery. Methods (45) 319-324. Argues that neuroimaging studies of motor imagery are (despite common claims to the contrary) not an appropriate way to study the brain activity that controls and coordinates bodily movements.
Dilman, I. (1968). Imagination. Analysis (28) 90-97.
DiVesta, F.J., Ingersoll, G., & Sunshine P. (1971). A Factor Analysis of Imagery Tests. Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior (10) 471-479.
Dix, M.R. (1985). An Inquiry into the Nature of Imagination and its Roles in Cognition. Unpublished Doctoral Dissertation: La Trobe University, Melbourne, Australia.
Djordjevic, J., Zatorre, R.J., Petrides, M., Boyle, J.A., and Jones-Gotman, M. (2005). Functional Neuroimaging of Odor Imagery. Neuroimage (24) 791-801.
Djordjevic, J., Zatorre, R.J., Petrides, M., & Jones-Gotman, M. (2004). The Mind's Nose: Effects of Odor and Visual Imagery on Odor Detection. Psychological Science (15 #3) 143-148. Imagery of smells interferes with the detection of a mismatched odor. This confirms the reality of olfactory imagery, a fact that was, apparently, subject to doubt.
Doob, L.W. (1964). Eidetic Imagery amongst the Ibo. Ethnology (3) 357-363. A study of eidetic imagery in a traditional African culture.
Doob, L.W. (1965). Exploring Eidetic Imagery among the Kamba of Central Kenya. Journal of Social Psychology (67) 3-22. Another study of eidetic imagery in a traditional African culture.
Doob, L.W. (1966). Eidetic Imagery: A Cross-Cultural Will-o’-the-Wisp? Journal of Psychology (63) 13-34.
Doob, L.W. (1972). The Ubiquitous Appearance of Images. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery (pp. 311-332). New York: Academic Press. A review of work on the cross-cultural study of imagery.
Doricchi, F., Iaria, G., Silvetti, M., Figliozzi, F., & Siegler, I. (2007). The "Ways" We Look at Dreams: Evidence from Unilateral Spatial Neglect (With an Evolutionary Account of Dream Bizarreness). Experimental Brain Research (178 #4) 450-461.
Driskell, J., Copper, C., & Moran, A. (1994). Does Mental Practice Enhance Performance? Journal of Applied Psychology (79) 481-492. Mental practice is a technique, now widely used in competitive sport and athletics, whereby physical skills can supposedly be enhanced through practicing them solely in the imagination. See also: Richardson (1967), Ryan & Simons (1982), Feltz & Landers (1983), Paivio (1985), Sheikh & Korn (1994), Morris et al. (2005), Short et al. (2006), Weinberg (2008). For a skeptical perspective, see Budney et al. (1994).
Dror, I.E., Ivey, C., & Rogus, C. (1997). Visual Mental Rotation of Possible and Impossible Objects. Psychonomic Bulletin and Review (4) 242-247.
Dror, I.E., Schmitz-Williams, I.C. & Smith, W. (2005). Older Adults Use Mental Representations That Reduce Cognitive Load: Mental Rotation Utilizes Holistic Representations and Processing. Experimental Aging Research (31) 409-420.
Dulin, D., Hatwell, Y., Pylyshyn, Z., & Chokron, S. (2008). Effects of Peripheral and Central Visual Impairment on Mental Imagery Capacity. Neuroscience and Biobehavioral Reviews (32 #8) 1396-1408. Many (probably most) people who are visually impaired due to brain damage, are found not to have lost their visual imagery (and vice versa). It is argued that this "double dissociation" is strong evidence against Kosslyn's view that visual mental images are "displayed" on a "visual buffer" consisting of the topographically organized areas in the occipital lobe.
Dunlap, K. (1914). Images and Ideas. Johns Hopkins University Circular (3 – March 1914) 25-41. A motor theory of imagery. See Washburn (1916) for a related view, and Thomas (1989) for discussion.
Eddy, J.K. & Glass, A.L. (1981). Reading and Listening to High and Low Imagery Sentences. Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior (20) 333-345. The selective interference effect in verbal memory.
Edelman, G.M. (1992). Bright Air, Brilliant Fire: On the Matter of Mind. New York: Basic Books.
Ehrlichman, H. & Barrett, J. (1983). Right Hemisphere Specialization for Mental Imagery: A Review of the Evidence. Brain and Cognition (2) 55-76. Argues that there is no good evidence to support the (at the time this was published) widespread assumption that imagery is primarily a function of the brain's right hemisphere.
Eisenegger, C., Herwig, U., & Jäncke, L. (2007). The Involvement of Primary Motor Cortex in Mental Rotation Revealed by Transcranial Magnetic Stimulation. European Journal of Neuroscience (25) 1240–1244.
Ekstein, M. (2001). Visions of a Compassionate World: Guided Imagery for Spiritual Growth and Social Transformation. Jerusalem: Urim Publications.
Elich, M., Thompson, R. W., & Miller, L. (1985). Mental Imagery as Revealed by Eye Movements and Spoken Predicates: A Test of Neurolinguistic Programming. Journal of Counseling Psychology (32) 622-625. Neurolinguistic programming theory (now widely discredited) holds that gaze direction during thinking indicates the modality of imagery (visual or auditory) used in the thinking. However, this study found no relation between gaze direction and imagery mode.
Ellis, R.D. (1995). Questioning Consciousness: The Interplay of Imagery, Cognition, and Emotion in the Human Brain. Amsterdam: John Benjamins. Gives an imagery based theory of thought and semantics. See Thomas (1997b) for discussion.
Emilsson, E.K. (1988). Plotinus on Sense Perception: A Philosophical Study. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Engelhard, I.M., van den Hout, M.A., Dek, E.C., Giele, C.L., van der Wielen, J.W., Reijnen, M.J., & van Roij, B. (2011). Reducing Vividness and Emotional Intensity of Recurrent "Flashforwards" by Taxing Working Memory: An Analogue Study. Journal of Anxiety Disorders (25 #4) 599-603. Deliberately moving the eyes whilst maintaining a visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness and emotional impact of the image. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there.
Engelhard, I.M., van den Hout, M.A., Janssen, W.C., & van der Beek J. (2010). Eye Movements Reduce Vividness and Emotionality of “Flashforwards”. Behaviour Research and Therapy (48 #5), 442-447. Deliberately moving the eyes whilst maintaining a visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness and emotional impact of the image. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there.
Erickson, M.H. & Erickson, E.M. (1938). The Hypnotic Induction of Hallucinatory Color Vision Followed by Pseudo-Negative After-Images. Journal of Experimental Psychology (22) 581-588.
Ernest C.H. (1977). Imagery Ability and Cognition: A Critical Review. Journal of Mental Imagery (2) 181-216.
Esrock, E.J. (1994). The Reader's Eye: Visual Imaging as Reader Response. Baltimore, MD. Johns Hopkins University Press. A historical treatment of the role of the concept of mental (as opposed to verbal) imagery in 20th century literary criticism, and a proposal, drawing on cognitive psychology research, for a mental imagery based theory of response to literature. Cf. Scarry (1995; 1999); Collins (1991); Zitlow (2000), Troscianko (2010, 2013).
Estes, D. (1994). Young Children's Understanding of the Mind: Imagery, Introspection, and Some Implications. Journal of Applied Developmental Psychology (15 #4) 529-548. Three year old children are aware of their mental imagery and recognize its unreality. Some five year olds use mental rotation, and are aware of doing so.
Fallgatter, A.J., Mueller, T.J., & Stirk W.K. (1997). Neurophysiological Correlates of Mental Imagery in Different Sensory Modalities. International Journal of Psychophysiology (25) 145-153.
Farah, M.J. (1984). The Neurological Basis of Mental Imagery: A Componential Analysis. Cognition (18) 245-72. Interprets the then know neurological evidence according to the theory of Kosslyn (1980). See Sergent (1990) for a critique, and Bartolomeo (2002) for a more recent review of the neurology that comes to very diferent conclusions.
Farah, M.J. (1988). Is Visual Imagery Really Visual? Overlooked Evidence from Neuropsychology. Psychological Review (95) 307-317.
Farah, M.J. (1989). Mechanisms of Imagery-Perception Interaction. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (15) 203-211. A study of the effects of imagery on perception of weak visual stimuli that finds support for the enactive theory of imagery of Neisser (1976) and Ryle (1949).
Farah, M.J. (1995). Current Issues in the Neuropsychology of Image Generation. Neuropsychologia (33) 1455-1471.
Farah, M.J., Hammond, K.M., Levine, D.N., & Calvanio, R. (1988). Visual and Spatial Mental Imagery: Dissociable Systems of Representation. Cognitive Psychology (20) 439-462.
Farah, M.J. & Smith, A.F. (1983). Perceptual Interference and Facilitation with Auditory Imagery. Perception & Psychophysics (33) 475-478. Imagining auditory tones facilitates perceptual detection of similar tones by recruiting attention to the relevant frequency.
Farah, M. J., Soso, M. J., & Dasheif, R. M. (1992). Visual Angle of the Mind's Eye Before and After Unilateral Occipital Lobectomy. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (18) 241-246.
Farran, E.K., Jarrold, C., & Gathercole, S.E. (2001). Block Design Performance in the Williams Syndrome Phenotype: A Problem with Mental Imagery? Journal of Child Psychology and Psychiatry (42 #6) 719-728.
Farley, A.M. (1974). VIPS: A Visual Imagery Perception System; the Result of Protocol Analysis. Ph.D. thesis, Carnegie-Mellon University, Pittsburgh, PA. Computer model of imagery based on the enactive theory of Hochberg (1968).
Farley, A.M. (1976). A Computer Implementation of Constructive Visual Imagery and Perception. In R.A. Monty J.W. Senders (Eds.) Eye Movements and Psychological Processes. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. A concise account of the model developed by Farley (1974).
Faw, B. (1997). Outlining a Brain Model of Mental Imaging Abilities. Neuroscience and Biobehavioral Reviews (21 #3) 283-288. A discussion of the brain areas involved in imagery which tries to accommodate the fact that some (small minority of) people report that they have no conscious experience of waking (i.e., non-dream) imagery. Faw himself testifies to being just such a “waking non-imager.”
Faw, B. (2009). Conflicting Intuitions May be Based on Differing Abilities: Evidence from Mental Imaging Research. Journal of Consciousness Studies (16 #4) 45-68. Further reflections on people who testify that they do not consciously experience waking imagery (most acknowledge that they still experience imagery during during dreams, and Faw thinks they may still have it unconsciously while awake), and on the significance of their existence for cognitive theory in general.
Feldman, M. (1968). Eidetic Imagery in Ghana: A Cross-Cultural Will-o'-the-Wisp? Journal of Psychology: Interdisciplinary and Applied (69 #2) 259-269. Evidence for eidetic imagery found in some children and adults from the Ghanaian countryside, but not amongst townspeople, even illiterate ones. Cf. Doob (1964 1965, 1966, 1972).
Feltz, D.L. & Landers, D.M. (1983). The Effects of Mental Practice on Motor Skill Learning and Performance: A Meta-Analysis. Journal of Sport Psychology (5) 25-57. Mental practice is a technique, now widely used in competitive sport and athletics, whereby physical skills can supposedly be enhanced through practicing them solely in the imagination. Other research on the topic includes: Richardson (1967), Ryan & Simons (1982), Paivio (1985), Sheikh & Korn (1994), Driskell et al. (1994), Morris et al. (2005), Short et al. (2006), Weinberg (2008). For a skeptical perspective, see Budney et al. (1994).
Ferguson, E.S. (1977). The Mind's Eye: Nonverbal Thought in Technology. Science (197) 827-836.
Ferguson, E.S. (1992). Engineering and the Mind's Eye. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Fernald, M.R. (1912). The Diagnosis of Mental Imagery. Psychological Monographs (14 #1 – Whole #58). An empirical exploration of the theory of imagery types then current in psychology. This theory held that people could usefully be classified into psychological types according to the preferred or predominant sensory mode of their imagery. Thus some people ("visiles") might think mostly in visual imagery, others ("audiles") in auditory imagery, others in motor or kinaesthetic imagery ("motiles"), and so on (see Angell, 1906 chap. 8, p. 165). Fernald's findings indicate that things are considerably more complex than this simple classification scheme would suggest. The modes of imagery we experience vary with circumstances as well as with individual proclivities, and these factors may interact in complex ways. Imagery type theory, however, would soon succumb both to the rising tide of Behaviorist iconophobia, and to devastating statistical and empirical critiques (Thorndike (1914 ch. 16; Griffits, 1927), from which it has not recovered..
ffytche, D.H., Howard, R.J., Brammer, M.J,. David, A., Woodruff, P., & Williams, S. (1998). The Anatomy of Conscious Vision: An fMRI Study of Visual Hallucinations. Nature Neuroscience (1) 738-742.
Finke, R.A. (1979). The Functional Equivalence of Mental Images and Errors of Movement. Cognitive Psychology (11) 235-264.
Finke, R.A. (1980). Levels of Equivalence in Imagery and Perception. Psychological Review (87) 113-132.
Finke, R.A. (1985). Theories Relating Imagery to Perception. Psychological Bulletin (98) 236-259.
Finke, R.A. (1986). Mental Imagery and the Visual System. Scientific American (245 #iii, March) 76-83.
Finke, R.A. (1989). Principles of Mental Imagery. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Useful textbook of the experimental cognitive psychology of imagery.
Finke, R.A. & Kosslyn, S.M. (1980). Mental Image Acuity in the Preipheral Visual Field. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (6) 126-139. These experiments on the "visual field" in mental imagery, and on "acuity" in different parts of it, have been strongly criticized on both methodological and conceptual grounds: Intons-Peterson & White (1981); Banks (1981); Thomas (2014). For a reply, see Finke & Kurtzman (1981c).
Finke, R.A. & Kurtzman, H. (1981a). Mapping the Visual Field in Mental Imagery. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (110) 501-517. These experiments on the "visual field" in mental imagery, and on "acuity" in different parts of it, have been strongly criticized on both methodological and conceptual grounds: Intons-Peterson & White (1981); Banks (1981); Thomas (2014). For a reply, see Finke & Kurtzman (1981c).
Finke, R.A. & Kurtzman, H. (1981b). Area and Contrast Effects upon Perceptual and Imagery Acuity. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (7) 825-832. These experiments on the "visual field" in mental imagery, and on "acuity" in different parts of it, have been strongly criticized on both methodological and conceptual grounds: Intons-Peterson & White (1981); Banks (1981); Thomas (2014). For a reply, see Finke & Kurtzman (1981c).
Finke, R.A. & Kurtzman, H. (1981c). Methodological Considerations in Experiments on Imagery Acuity. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (7 #4) 848-854. A reply to the criticisms made of the work of Finke & Kurtzman (1981a,b) by Intons-Peterson, & White (1981) and Banks (1981).
Finke, R.A. & Pinker, S. (1982). Spontaneous Imagery Scanning in Mental Extrapolation. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Learning and Memory (8) 142-147.
Finke, R.A. & Pinker, S. (1983). Directional Scanning of Remembered Visual Patterns. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory and Cognition (9) 398-410.
Finke, R.A., Pinker, S., & Farah, M.J. (1989). Reinterpreting Visual Patterns in Mental Imagery. Cognitive Science (13) 51-78.
Finke, R.A. & Schmidt, M.J. (1977). Orientation-Specific Aftereffects Following Imagination. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (3) 599-606. A striking finding, but see Broerse & Crassini (1980, 1984), Kunen & May (1980), Harris (1982) and Finke (1989 ch.2).
Finke, R.A. & Schmidt, M.J. (1978). The Quantitative Measure of Pattern Representation in Images Using Orientation Specific Color Aftereffects. Perception and Psychophysics (23) 515-520. See the annotation to the previous item.
Finke, R.A. & Shepard, R.N. (1986). Visual Functions of Mental Imagery. In K.R. Boff, L. Kaufman, & J.P. Thomas (Eds.), Handbook of Perception and Human Performance, Vol. 2. New York: Wiley-Interscience.
Finke, R.A., Ward, T.B., & Smith, S.M. (1992). Creative Cognition: Theory, Research, and Applications. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Gives imagery a large role in inventive thinking.
Fiorio, M., Tinazzi, M., & Aglioti, S.M. (2006). Selective Impairment of Hand Mental Rotation in Patients with Focal Hand Dystonia. Brain (129) 47-54.
Firth, H. & Oswald, I. (1975). Eye Movements and Visually Active Dreams. Psychophysiology (12) 602-606.
Flanagan, O.J.jr., (1984). The Science of the Mind. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Suggests a “six-code” instead of a Dual Code theory of memory (cf. Kintsch, 1977).
Fleckenstein, K.S., Calendrillo, L.T., & Worley, D.A. (Eds.) (2002). Language and Image in the Reading-Writing Classroom: Teaching Vision. Mahah, NJ: Erlbaum. Imagery in the elementary school.
Fletcher, P.C., Frith, C.D., Baker, S.C., Shallice, T., Frackowiak, R.S.J., & Dolan, R.J. (1995). The Mind's Eye - Precuneus Activation in Memory-Related Imagery. NeuroImage (2 #3) 195-200. Evidence that the precuneus, a structure in the medial parietal area of the brain, plays a crucial role in visual memory imagery. However, see Krause et al. (1999) for an alternative explanation.
Flew, A. (1953). Images, Supposing and Imagining. Philosophy (28) 246-254.
Flusberg, S.J. & Boroditsky, L. (2011). Are Things That Are Hard to Physically Move Also Hard to Imagine Moving? Psychonomic Bulletin and Review (18) 158-164. The respective roles of visual imagery and motor imagery in mental rotation.
Fodor, J.A. (1975). The Language of Thought. New York: Thomas Crowell. (Paperback edition: Harvard University Press, 1980) The main thesis of this very influential book is that cognition depends upon an unconscious, language-like representational system innately built into the brain, and which Fodor calls mentalese. However, it also includes a substantial (and also very influential) section on imagery arguing that imagery representations probably have a real role in cognition, but that images (which he takes to be picture-like) cannot be unambiguously meaningful in their own right, and therefore must derive their semantics from mentalese: they function in cognition as “images under descriptions.”
Fontaine, K. (2000). Healing Practices: Alternative Therapies for Nursing. Upper Saddle River, NJ : Prentice Hall. Includes a section on guided imagery techniques for pain relief.
Fourkas, A.D., Avenanti, A., Urgesi, C., & Aglioti, S.M. (2006). Corticospinal Facilitation During First and Third Person Imagery. Experimental Brain Research (168) 143-151.
Fourtassi, M., Hajjioui, A., Urquizar, C., Rossetti, Y., Rode, G., & Pisella, L. (2013). Iterative Fragmentation of Cognitive Maps in a Visual Imagery Task. PLoS One (8 #7): e68560, doi:10.1371/journal.pone.0068560 [Available online] See comment to next item (Fourtassi et al., 2011.)
Fourtassi, M., Rode, G., Urquizar, C., Salemme R., & Pisella, L. (2011). Spontaneous Eye Movements During Visual Mental Imagery. Journal of Eye Movement Research (4) 149. Available online Patterns of eye movement during imagery are similar to those in visual perception of the same scene. (See also Fourtassi et al. (2013), and see the comment on Brandt & Stark (1997) for the significance of this, and citations to other work on this issue.)
Keller, E. Fox & Grontkowski, C.R. (1983). The Mind's Eye. In S. Harding & M.B. Hintikka (Eds.), Discovering Reality: Feminist Perspectives on Epistemology, Metaphysics and Philosophy of Science (pp. 207-24). Dordrecht, Netherlands: Reidel. A feminist critique of what is seen as the masculine scientific and philosophical tradition's excessive concentration on the visual aspect of cognition and imagination, at the expense of the other, allegedly more feminine, sensory modes, especially touch. (Cf. Newton, 1982). Apparently an example of the "denigration of vision" tradition discussed by Jay (1993).
Franklin, J. (2000). Diagrammatic Reasoning and Modelling in the Imagination: The Secret Weapons of the Scientific Revolution. In C. Freeland & A. Corones (Eds.), 1543 and All That: Image and Word, Change and Continuity in the Proto-Scientific Revolution (pp. 53-115). Dordrecht, Netherlands: Kluwer.
Fraser, A. (1891). Visualization as a Chief Source of the Psychology of Hobbes, Locke, Berkeley and Hume. American Journal of Psychology (4 #2) 230-247. Reprint available online Argues that individual differences in imagery vividness may have underlain some of the differences between the views of these philosophers, particularly their views on general ideas. See the comment on Berman (2008), who expresses a similar view, for a critique of this sort of suggestion.
Frede, D. (1992). The Cognitive Role of Phantasia in Aristotle. In M.C. Nussbaum & A.O. Rorty (Eds.) Essays on Aristotle's De Anima (pp. 279-295). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Freeman, W.J. (1983). The Physiological Basis of Mental Images. Biological Psychiatry (18) 1107-1125. Preprint available online This is concerned with olfactory imagery from the perspective of neural dynamics, and attempts to relate the concept of mental image to that of search image as used in Behavioral Ecology (see Tinbergen, 1960; Atema et al., 1980; Lawrence & Allen, 1983; Langley, 1996; Blough, 2002 – all in the supplementary bibliography).
Frege, G. (1884). Grundlagen der Arithmetik (The Foundations of Arithmetic). (Translated from the German by J.L. Austin, Oxford: Blackwell, 1953.) Argues, in §§59-60, that the meanings of words, being public and objective, cannot be based upon imagery, which is inherently private, subjective, and idiosyncratic.
Freyd, J.J. (1987). Dynamic Mental Representations. Psychological Review (94) 427-38. Imagery in motion.
Frick, R.W. (1987). A Dissociation of Conscious Visual Imagery and Visual Short-Term Memory. Neuropsychologia (25 #4) 707-712. Visual Short-Term Memory, the visuospatial sketchpad component of Working Memory, and visual mental imagery are all closely related psychological concepts which are often conflated. Frick, however, offers evidence to suggest that visual Short-Term Memory and imagery should be distinguished. He shows that subjects who report their imagery to be subjectively very poor, may nevertheless do well on tests of visual short term memory. However, the sorts of subjective self-reports of imagery ability, on which this work depends may not be reliable (Thomas, 2009; Schwitzgebel, 2002a, 208, 2012 ch. 3). Also, other more recent experimental work suggests that imagery and visual working memory are, if not identical, very closely bound up with one another (Keogh & Pearson, 2011, Albers et al., 2013; Tong, 2013).
Furbank P.N. (1970). Reflections on the Word ‘Image’. London: Secker & Warburg. Discusses (very critically) the widespread use of the word ‘imagery’ as a term of art of literary criticism, with a historical account of the origins of the usage that (amongst other things) deals with the relation between the concepts of literary imagery and mental imagery. Furbank's conception of the latter is clearly heavily influenced by Sartre (1940), and, especially, Ryle (1949).
Furlong, E.J. (1953). Abstract Ideas and Images. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (Supplementary volume 27) 121-136.
Furlong, E.J. (1961). Imagination. London: Allen & Unwin.
Furst, B. (1945). Stop Forgetting: How to Develop Your Memory and Put it to Practical Use. New York: Garden City Press. Instruction in the use of mnemonic techniques, particularly imagery-based ones, aimed at a popular audience.
Furst, B. (1957). The Practical Way to a Better Memory. New York: Fawcett World Library. Instruction in the use of mnemonic techniques, particularly imagery-based ones, aimed at a popular audience. It is cited by several of the pioneers of scientific research into the mnemonic effects of imagery.
Gallese, V. & Lakoff, G. (2005). The Brain's Concepts: the Role of the Sensory-motor System in Conceptual Knowledge. Cognitive Neuropsychology (22) 455–479.
Galton, F. (1880a). Statistics of Mental Imagery. Mind (5) 301-318. Reprint available online Pioneering individual differences survey of imagery vividness. Much (but not all) of the material in this article can also be found in Galton's (1883) book. Galton claims to have found that many intellectuals, and scientists in particular, have very weak visual imagery, or even lack it altogether. However, a recent study by Brewer & Schommer-Aikins (2006) persuasively refutes this claim. Drawing on Galton's private papers, Burbridge (1994) fills in many details of Galton's work on imagery that do not appear in Galton's own publications, including the names and individual findings for many of the scientists studied.
Galton, F. (1880b). Mental Imagery. Fortnightly Review (28) 312-324. Reprint available online Further discussion of Galton's researches into the subject, with details of his findings and theories not to be found elsewhere.
Galton, F. (1880c). Visualised Numerals. Nature (21) 252-6 & 494-495. Reprint available online Number forms (also discussed in Galton, 1883). For more recent work on number forms, see Spalding & Zangwill (1950); Seron et al. (1992).
Galton, F. (1883). Inquiries into Human Faculty and its Development. London: Macmillan. Includes a summary and discussion of the results of Galton's (1880a,b,c) pioneering studies of mental imagery and of individual differences in imagery vividness. Also presents a model for general images (of character types) based upon superimposed photographic exposures, and a descriptive account of arithmetical images (“number forms”). (For more recent work on number forms, see: Spalding & Zangwill (1950); Seron et al. (1992).) However, see Brewer & Schommer-Aikins (2006) for a recent, strong challenge to Galton's influential claims about low imagery ability in scientists.
Galton, F. (1894). Arithmetic by Smell. Psychological Review, 1, 61-62. Reprint available online A pioneering (and strange) study of olfactory imagery.
Gambrell, L.B. & Bales, R.J. (1986). Mental Imagery and the Comprehension-Monitoring Performance of Fourth-and Fifth-grade Poor Readers. Reading Research Quarterly (21 #4) 454-464. Instructions to students to form mental images of what they were reading about improved their comprehension, enabling them to spot inconsistencies in the text.
Gagnepain, P., Henson, R.N., & Anderson, M.C. (2014). Suppressing Unwanted Memories Reduces Their Unconscious Influence via Targeted Cortical Inhibition. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences of the U.S.A. (111 #13) E1310-E1319. This is concerned, in large part, with intrusive imagery, mental imagery of unpleasant or disturbing scenes that comes to mind involuntarily, and is difficult (but not impossible) to dismiss from consciousness.
Ganis, G., Keenan, J.P., Kosslyn, S.M., & Pascual-Leone, A. (2000). Transcranial Magnetic Stimulation of Primary Motor Cortex Affects Mental Rotation. Cerebral Cortex (10) 175-180.
Ganis, G., Thompson, W.L., & Kosslyn, S.M. (2004). Brain Areas Underlying Visual Mental Imagery and Visual Perception: An fMRI Study. Cognitive Brain Research (20) 226-241. Control (frontal and parietal) areas of the brain were equally activated during seeing and imaging, but sensory areas (occipital and temporal) were not activated so much during imagery. These results suggest that although certain "cognitive control processes" function comparably in both visual imagery and visual perception, at least some "visual sensory processes" (equated with activity in temporal and occipital regions) may function differently. No correlation was found between the fMRI measures and VVIQ scores.
Ganis, G.G., Thompson, W.L., Mast, F.W., and Kosslyn, S.M. (2003). Visual Imagery in Cerebral Visual Dysfunction. Neurologic Clinics of North America (21) 631-646. According to Kosslyn and his collaborators, visual mental images are activation states of the retinotopically mapped “early” visual areas of the brain, in the occipital cortex (Kosslyn, 1994, 2005; Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson, 2001; Ganis, Thompson, & Kosslyn, 2004; Kosslyn, Thompson, & Ganis, 2006). However, there is now much accumulated evidence from neurological studies of brain damaged patients that strongly implies that this cannot be the case, because patients whose brains are damaged in these areas, and are partially or completely blind because of it, often have unimpaired visual imagery, and, sometimes, even experience vivid, well-formed hallucinations in just those regions of the visual field in which they are blind (Weiskrantz et al., 1974; Lance, 1976; Kölmel, 1985; Roland & Gulyàs, 1994; Chatterjee & Southwood, 1995; Goldenberg et al., 1995; Goldenberg, 1989; Ramachandran & Hirstein, 1997; Bartolomeo, 2002; Kleiter et al., 2007; Ashwin & Tsaloumas, 2007; Dulin et al., 2008; Zago et al., 2010; Bridge et al., 2012). This article attempts to argue that evidence of this sort should be discounted.
Gardner, H. (1987). The Mind's New Science: A History of the Cognitive Revolution (2nd edition). New York: Basic Books. Includes a fairly good account of the “analog-propositional” debate.
Garry, A. (1977). Mental Images. Personalist (58, January) 28-38.
Gauker, C. (2011). Words and Images: An Essay on the Origin of Ideas. Oxford: Oxford University Press. Argues that that much of cognition consists in thinking by means of mental imagery, without the help of concepts. Concepts and truly conceptual thought, however, only arise with the development of language, the meaningfulness of which is not grounded in imagery, but, rather arises from its communicative use.
Gawain, S. (1982). Creative Visualization. New York: Bantam.
Gay, M.-C., Hanin, D., & Luminet, O. (2008). Effectiveness of an Hypnotic Imagery Intervention on Reducing Alexithymia. Contemporary Hypnosis (25 #1) 1-13. See the comment on Campos et al. (2000).
Gazzaniga, M.S. (2004). The Cognitive Neurosciences (3rd edn.). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Gbadamosi, J., & Zangemeister, W.H. (2001). Visual Imagery in Hemianopic Patients. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (13 #7) 45-56. As the enactive theory of imagery might lead one to expect, the pattern of eye movements made during imagery resembles that which would be made during perception of the imagined scene, if it were actually present. For further evidence on this point, see Brandt & Stark (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment on that article.
Gendler, T.S. (2004). Thought Experiments Rethought – and Reperceived. Philosophy of Science (71 #5), 1152-1163. Argues that imagery plays a crucial role in some (not all) scientific thought experiments, which thus cannot be fully reduced to cases of propositional reasoning.
Georgiou, A.K.A. (2007). An Embodied Cognition View of Imagery-Based Reasoning in Science: Lessons from Thought Experiments. Croatian Journal of Philosophy (7) 215-248.
Georgopoulos, A.P., Lurito, J.T., Petrides, M., & Schwartz, A.B. (1989). Mental Rotation of the Neuronal Population Vector. Science (243) 234-236. A neuroscientific study of the mental rotation effect (in monkeys) which links it to motor control.
Giaquinto, M. (1992). Visualizing as a Means of Geometrical Discovery. Mind and Language (7) 382-401.
Giaquinto, M. (1993). Visualizing in Arithmetic. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (53) 385-396.
Gibson, J.J. (1970). On the Relation Between Hallucination and Perception. Leonardo (3) 425-7.
Gibson, J.J. (1974). Visualizing Conceived as Visual Apprehending Without Any Particular Point of Observation. Leonardo (7) 41-42.
Gibson, J.J. (1979). The Ecological Approach to Visual Perception. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin.
Glasgow, J.I. (1993). The Imagery Debate Revisited: A Computational Perspective. Computational Intelligence (9) 310-333. An array model of imagery similar in spirit to that of Kosslyn and Shwartz (1977). Published together with numerous peer commentaries and author's reply.
Glasgow, J. & Papadias, D. (1992). Computational Imagery. Cognitive Science (16) 355-394. More about the model proposed by Glasgow (1993).
Goebel, R., Khorram-Sefat, D., Muckli, L., Hacker, H., & Singer, W. (1998). The Constructive Nature of Vision: Direct Evidence from Functional Magnetic Resonance Imaging Studies of Apparent Motion and Motion Imagery. European Journal of Neuroscience (10) 1563–1573.
Goldenberg, G. (1989). The Ability of Patients with Brain Damage to Generate Mental Visual Images. Brain (112) 305-325. See also Goldenberg (1993, 1998), and Bartolomeo (2002, 2008; Bartolomeo et al., 2013).
Goldenberg, G. (1992). Loss of Visual Imagery and Loss of Visual Knowledge - A Case Study. Neuropsychologia (30) 1081-1099. Loss of visual imagery due to brain damage. In some cases this can occur without there being significant impairment to actual vision. See also: Brain (1954); Basso et al. (1980); Botez et al. (1985); Young & van de Wal (1996); Riddoch (1990); Moro et al. (2008); Zeman et al. (2010).
Goldenberg, G. (1993). The Neural Basis of Mental Imagery. Baillière's Clinical Neurology (2) 265-286. Brain damage in different locations can impair imagery of certain types or aspects of visual objects (e.g., colors, faces, visual forms, letters) whilst leaving it intact for others.
Goldenberg, G. (1998). Is There a Common Substrate for Visual Recognition and Visual Imagery? Neurocase (4) 141-147.
Goldenberg, G., Müllbacher, W., & Nowak, A. (1995). Imagery Without Perception – A Case Study of Anosognosia for Cortical Blindness. Neuropsychologia (33) 1375-1382. A case of Anton's syndrome (blindness denial) in a patient blinded because of almost complete destruction of V1 (primary visual cortex). There is evidence that this patient had good visual imagery despite most of V1 being absent.
Goldston, D.B., Hinrichs, J.V., & Richman, C.L. (1985) Subjects Expectations, Individual Variability, and the Scanning of Mental Images. Memory and Cognition (13) 365-370.
Goldthwait, C. (1933). Relation of Eye Movements to Visual Imagery. American Journal of Psychology (45) 106-110.
Gonzalez, M.A., Campos, A., & Pérez, M.J. (1997). Mental imagery and Creative Thinking. Journal of Psychology (131 #4) 357-364. Correlations found between scores on tests of spatial reasoning ability and imagery control, and tests of creative thinking.
Gray, C.R. & Gummerman, K. (1975). The Enigmatic Eidetic Image: A Critical Examination of Methods, Data, and Theories. Psychological Bulletin (82) 383-407.
Gregory, D. (2010). Visual Imagery: Visual Format or Visual Content? Mind and Language (25 #4) 394-417. Rejects the view (ascribed to Pylyshyn) that the visual nature of imagery consists solely in the nature of the content represented.
Grieco, B.P.A., Lima, P.M.V., De Gregorio, M., & França, F.M.G. (2010). Producing Pattern Examples from "Mental" Images. Neurocomputing (73) 1057-1064. I think it is worth noting that although this exercise in computational connectionist modeling employs a type of representation that could be construed as "quasi-pictorial" (in Kosslyn's (1980) sense), no attempt is made to relate this work to any aspect of the empirical or theoretical (or even anecdotal) literature on mental imagery in humans, not even Kosslyn's work, nor any of the several attempts to model mental imagery computationally (e.g.: Kosslyn & Shwartz, 1977, 1978; Julstrom & Baron, 1985; Mel, 1986, 1990; Stucki & Pollack, 1992; Glasgow & Papadias, 1992; Glasgow, 1993). I think it is questionable whether this article is at all relevant to the psychological phenomenon of mental imagery. Apart from the fact that it repeatedly uses the term, it scarcely even pretends to be..
Griffits, C.H. (1927). Individual Differences in Imagery. Psychological Monographs (37 #3) Whole No. 172. A detailed empirical study, that reaches the conclusion that the theory of imagery types, which was influential amongst early 20th century psychologists (e.g., Angell, 1906 chap. 8; Fernald, 1912), is unworkable. However, by this time, interest in imagery types had already begun to ebb, thanks to the earlier criticisms of Thorndike (1914) and the rise of Behaviorism.
Gross, B. R. 1973. Professor Furlong, Imagining and Imaging. Studi Internazionali di Filosofia (5) 199-208.
Grueter, T. (2006). Picture This. Scientific American Mind (17, #1) 18-23. A brief popularizing account of the analog/propositional debate.
Grüter, T., Grüter, M., Bell, V., & Carbon, C.-C. (2009). Visual Mental Imagery in Congenital Prosopagnosia. Neuroscience Letters (453 #3) 135-140. Evidence that congenital prosopagnosics (people with "face blindness") have very weak imagery (as measured by the VVIQ (Marks, 1973)). But see Tree & Wilkie (2010); Grüter, Grüter & Carbon (2011).
Grüter, T., Grüter, G., & Carbon, C.-C. (2011). Congenital prosopagnosia. Diagnosis and mental imagery: Commentary on "Tree JJ, and Wilkie J. Face and object imagery in congenital prosopagnosia: A case series." Cortex (47 #4) 511-513. See Grüter, Grüter, Bell & Carbon (2009); Tree & Wilkie (2010); Tree (2011).
Grush, R. (2004). The Emulation Theory of Representation: Motor Control, Imagery, and Perception. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (27) 377-442. Includes an account of motor imagery, and an account of visual imagery based upon the connectionist robot model of Mel (1990) (although Grush may not be committed to its connectionist aspect). This model amounts to a version of quasi-pictorial theory. However, it is not clear that Grush's "emulation" theory of mental representation implies that images must be quasi-pictures (let alone ones of the particular sort envisaged by Mel). Grush does not consider the possibility of fitting other types of imagery theory into his "emulationist" framework.
Grüsser, O.-J. & Landis, T. (1991). Visual Agnosias and Other Disturbances of Visual Perception and Cognition. London: Macmillan. Does not go into great detail about mental imagery proper, but provides useful reviews of what is known about other types of quasi-perceptual phenomena, such as phosphenes (ch. 10) and afterimages (ch. 23).
Guillot, A., Collet, C., Nguyen, V.O., Malouin, F., Richards, C., & Doyon, J. (2009). Brain Activity During Visual Versus Kinesthetic Imagery: An fMRI Study. Human Brain Mapping (30) 2157-2172. Visual imagery activated predominantly the occipital regions and the superior parietal lobules, whereas kinesthetic imagery yielded more activity in motor-associated structures and the inferior parietal lobule.
Gummerman, K., Gray, C.R., & Wilson, J.M. (1972). An Attempt to Assess Eidetic Imagery Objectively. Psychonomic Science (28 #2) 115-118. Out of 270 diverse subjects tested, only two children showed any sign of having eidetic imagery, even by the loosest criterion used. The two were both "familial retardates". None of the people tested could fuse separately presented picture parts into a whole.
Gunter, R.W. & Bodner, G.E. (2008). How Eye Movements Affect Unpleasant Memories: Support for a Working-Memory Account. Behaviour Research and Therapy (46) 913-931. Deliberately moving the eyes whilst maintaining an unpleasant visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness, completeness and emotional impact of the image. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there.
Haber, R.N. (1970). Imagine! They are Finally Talking about Images Again. Contemporary Psychology (15) 556-559.
Haber, R.N. (1979). Twenty Years of Haunting Eidetic Imagery: Where's the Ghost? Behavioral and Brain Sciences (2) 583-629. A major review of research on the elusive phenomenon of eidetic imagery, with appended commentaries.
Haber, R.N. & Haber, R.B. (1964). Eidetic Imagery: I. Frequency. Perceptual and Motor Skills (19 #1), 131-138. Twelve (about 8%) out of a sample of 179 elementary school aged children were found to have eidetic imagery. Their images lasted as long as 4 minutes, during which nearly all of the details of a stimulus picture could be reproduced. However, their memory of the stimulus was not much better after their imagery had faded than that of the children who did not have eidetic imagery.
Hall, C.R., Mack, D.E., Paivio, A., & Hausenblas, H.A. (1998). Imagery Use by Athletes: Development of the Sport Imagery Questionnaire. International Journal of Sport Psychology (29) 73-89.
Halligan, P.W. & Marshall, J.C. (1993). The History and Clinical Presentation of Neglect. In I.H. Robertson & J.C. Marshall (Eds.), Unilateral Neglect: Clinical and Experimental Studies (pp. 3-26). Hove, U.K.: Erlbaum. Principally a review of the study of unilateral neglect as a perceptual neuropathology, but it also touches on the imaginal aspect of the syndrome.
Hampson, P.J. (1979). The Role of Imagery in Cognition. Ph.D. thesis, University of Lancaster, Lancaster, U.K.
Hampson, P.J. & Duffy, C. (1984). Verbal and Spatial Interference Effects in Congenitally Blind and Sighted Subjects. Canadian Journal of Psychology (38) 411-20. Selective interference effects (see Brooks (1967, 1968)) demonstrated between spatial perception and spatial imagery in the congenitally blind.
Hampson, P.J., Marks, D.F., & Richardson, J.T.E. (Eds.) (1990). Imagery: Current Developments. London: Routledge.
Hampson, P.J. & Morris, P.E. (1978). Unfulfilled Expectations: A Critique of Neisser's Theory of Imagery. Cognition (6) 79-85. A critique of Neisser's (1976) enactive theory of imagery. See Neisser (1978) for reply.
Hampson, P.J. & Morris, P.E. (1979). Cyclical Processing: A Framework for Imagery Research. Journal of Mental Imagery (3) 11-22. An attempt to synthesize the quasi-pictorial and enactive theories.
Hannay, A. (1971). Mental Images – A Defence. London: Allen & Unwin. Argues for the reality of inner pictures (cf. Hannay, 1973); but see Candlish (1975).
Hannay, A. (1973). To See a Mental Image. Mind (82) 161-262.
Harman, G. (1998). Intentionality. In W. Bechtel & G. Graham (Eds.), A Companion to Cognitive Science (pp. 602-610). Oxford: Blackwell. Includes a discussion of the intentionality of imagery.
Harris, J.P. (1982). The VVIQ and Imagery-Induced McCollough Effects: An Alternative Analysis. Perception and Psychophysics (32) 290-292. Challenges the results of Finke & Schmidt (1977, 1978).
Harrison, B. (1962-3). Meaning and Mental Images. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (63) 237-250.
Harshman, R.A. & Paivio A. (1987). "Paradoxical" Sex Differences in Self-Reported Imagery. Canadian Journal of Psychology (41 #3) 287-302. Females tend to report more and more vivid imagery than males but also tend to score lower on tests of spatial ability. It is suggested that this may indicate women have stronger static imagery ability, whereas males are better at dynamic transformation or manipulation of images.
Hassabis, D., Kumaran, D., & Maguire, E.A. (2007). Using Imagination to Understand the Neural Basis of Episodic Memory. Journal of Neuroscience (27 #52) 14365-14374.
Hassabis, D., Kumaran, D., Vann, S.D., & Maguire, E.A. (2007). Patients with Hippocampal Amnesia Cannot Imagine New Experiences. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences of the United States of America (104) 1726-1731. Reprint available online
Hauck, P.D., Walsh, C.C., & Kroll, N.E.A. (1976). Visual Imagery Mnemonics: Common vs. Bizarre Mental Images. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (7) 160-162.
Hauk, O., Davis, M.H., Kherif, F., & Pulvermüller, F. (2008). Imagery or Meaning? Evidence for a Semantic Origin of Category-Specific Brain Activity in Metabolic Imaging. European Journal of Neuroscience (27) 1856-1866. An fMRI study which argues that distributed neuronal ensembles ground language and concepts in the appropriate perception-action systems of the brain. Highly (visually) imageable words selectively activated the left fusiform gyrus; action related words selectively activated the left middle temporal gyrus. (Neither caused significant occipital activation.)
Hayes, J.R. (1973). On the Function of Visual Imagery in Elementary Mathematics. In W.G. Chase (Ed.) Visual Information Processing. New York: Academic Press.
Hayes-Roth, F. (1979). Distinguishing Theories of Mental Representation: A Critique of Anderson's “Arguments Concerning Mental Imagery”. Psychological Review (86) 376-382.
Hebb, D.O. (1968). Concerning Imagery. Psychological Review (75) 466-477. Outlines a version of motor or enactive theory.
Hebb, D.O. (1969). The Mind's Eye. Psychology Today (2) 54-57 & 67-68.
Hegarty, M. (1992). Mental Animation: Inferring Motion from Static Displays of Mechanical Systems. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (18) 1084-1102. Animated mental images.
Hegarty, M. & Waller, D. (2004). A Dissociation Between Mental Rotation and Perspective-Taking Spatial Abilities. Intelligence (32) 175-191. Individual differences in mental rotation ability are correlated with, but not the same as, differences in ability to imagine a layout from different perspectives.
Heil, J. (1982). What Does the Mind's Eye Look At? Journal of Mind and Behavior (3) 143-149. An adverbial account of imagery, which may be considered the philosophical counterpart (at the level of language analysis) to the enactive theory in cognitive science. Imagery is regarded not as the having of a mental object (an image) in the mind, rather it is a type of activity, a way of thinking about some actual or possible real-world object. See Rabb (1975), Tye (1984), and Meijsing (2006) for further defenses of adverbial theory.
Heil, J. (1998). Philosophy of Mind. London: Routledge. Mainly an introductory textbook, but the in the final chapter Heil argues for an imagery based account of intentionality and thought.
Heremans, E., Helsen, W. F., & Feys, P. (2008). The Eyes as a Mirror of Our Thoughts: Quantification of Motor Imagery Through Eye Movement Registration. Behavioural Brain Research (187 #2) 351-360.
Herman, J.H., Erman, M., Boys, R., Peiser, L.,Taylor, M.E., & Roffwarg, H.P. (1984). Evidence for a Directional Correspondence Between Eye Movements and Dream Imagery in REM Sleep. Sleep (7 #1) 52-63.
Hesslow, G. (2002). Conscious Thought as Simulation of Behavior and Perception. Trends in Cognitive Sciences (6) 242-247. Suggests that imagery can be thought of as a simulation of vision. Apparently unaware of Currie's (1995; Currie & Ravenscroft, 1997) earlier suggestions to that effect, or the apparatus of simulation theory (e.g. Davies & Stone, 1995) behind them.
Heuer, F., Fischman, D., & Reisberg, D. (1986). Why Does Vivid Imagery Hurt Colour Memory? Canadian Journal of Psychology (40) 161-175. Individual differences study using the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973). A companion piece to Reisberg, Culver, Heuer, & Fischman (1986).
Hilgard, E.R. (1981). Imagery and Imagination in American Psychology, Journal of Mental Imagery (5) 5-66. Historical reflections, with appended commentaries.
Hilton, W. (1914). Applied Psychology: Power of Mental Imagery: Being the Fifth of a Series of Twelve Volumes on the Applications of Psychology to the Problems of Personal and Business Efficiency. San Francisco: Applied Psychology Press. An early imagery self-help book.
Hinnell, C. & Virji-Babul, N. (2004). Mental Rotation Abilities in Individuals with Down Syndrome - A Pilot Study. Down Syndrome Research and Practice (9, #1) 12-18. Available online Down syndrome children show similar speed of mental rotation to age matched normally developing children, but greater error rates.
Hinton, G. (1979). Some Demonstrations of the Effects of Structural Descriptions in Mental Imagery. Cognitive Science (3) 231-250. Argues for the view that images are “structural descriptions”. A version of the “propositional” theory defended by Pylyshyn.
Hobbes, T. (1651). Leviathan. (Edited by C.B. Macpherson, Harmondsworth, U.K.: Penguin, 1968.) Hobbes outlines his materialist theories of sense perception, imagination and of thought as associative trains of imagery in the early chapters of this work. A little more detail can be found in some of his Latin works that are translated and collected in Calkins (1963).
Hobson, J.A. (2009). REM Sleep and Dreaming: Towards a Theory of Protoconsciousness. Nature Reviews: Neuroscience (10) 803-813.
Hochberg, J. (1968). In the Mind's Eye. In R.N. Haber (Ed.), Contemporary Theory and Research in Visual Perception. Holt Rinehart & Winston. New York. pp. 309-331. Argues for an enactive approach.
Hochberg, J. (2001). In the Mind’s Eye: Perceptual Coupling and Sensorimotor Contingencies. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (24) 986.
Hochberg, J. & Gellman, L. (1977). The Effect of Landmark Features on Mental Rotation Times. Memory and Cognition (5) 23-26.
Hochman, J. (1994). Ahsen's Image Psychology. Journal of Mental Imagery (18) 1-118.
Hoffman, R.R. & Senter, R.J. (1978). Recent History of Psychology: Mnemonic Techniques and the Psycholinguistic Revolution. Psychological Record (28) 3-15. Throws light on how cognitive psychologists came to rediscover imagery mnemonics in the 1960s.
Hollard, V.D. & Delius, J.D. (1982). Rotational Invariance in Visual Pattern Recognition by Pigeons and Humans. Science (218) 804-806. Pigeons do not seem to do mental rotation like humans do. See Rilling & Neiworth (1987), Köhler et al. (2005), Hopkins et al. (1993), and Delius & Hollard (1995) for further results on mental rotation in animals.
Holmes, E.A., Geddes, J.R., Colom, F., & Goodwin, G.M. (2008). Mental Imagery as an Emotional Amplifier: Application to Bipolar Disorder. Behaviour Research and Therapy (46) 1251-1258. Argues that imagery affects emotions more than verbal thoughts of similar content, and provides a model of how this may play a role in the etiology of bipolar disorder ("manic-depression").
Holšánová, J. (2010). How We Focus Attention in Picture Viewing, Picture Description and Mental Imagery. In K. Sachs-Hombach & R. Totzke (Eds.), Bilder - Sehen - Denken. Cologne, Germany: Herbert von Halem Verlag. Preprint available online
Holšánová, J., Andersson, R., Johansson, R., Holmqvist K., & Strömqvist S. (2010). Lund Eye Tracking Studies in Research on Language and Cognition. Slovo a Slovesnost (71) 317-328. Reprint available online
Holt, R.R. (1964). Imagery: The Return of the Ostracised. American Psychologist (19) 254-266. Influential account of the historical vicissitudes of the concept of imagery in scientific psychology.
Hong, C.C.-H., Harris, J.C., Pearlson, G.D., Kim, J.-S., Calhoun, V.D., Fallon, J.H., Golay, X., Gillen, J.S., Simmonds, D.J., van Zijl, P.C.M., Zee, D.S., & Pekar, J.J. (2009). fMRI Evidence for Multisensory Recruitment Associated With Rapid Eye Movements During Sleep. Human Brain Mapping (30 #5) 1705-1722.
Hong, C.C.-H., Potkin, S.G., Antrobus, J.S., Dow, B.M., Callaghan, G.M., & Gillin, J.C. (1997). REM Sleep Eye Movement Counts Correlate with Visual Imagery in Dreaming: A Pilot Study. Psychophysiology (34) 377-381. Support for an enactive account of imagery. Cf. Brandt & Stark (1997), and the other citations listed in the comment on that article. See also Hong et al. (2009).
Hopkins, R. (2006). With Sight Too Much in Mind, Mind Too Little in Sight? Philosophical Books (47) 293-305. Essay review of McGinn's Mindsight (2004). See McGinn (2006) for reply.
Hopkins, W.D., Fagot, J., & Vauclair, J. (1993). Mirror-Image Matching and Mental Rotation Problem Solving by Baboons (Papio Papio): Unilateral Input Enhances Performance. Journal of Experimental Psycholgy: General (122) 61-72. Baboons do not seem to do mental rotation like humans do. See Köhler et al. (2005), Rilling & Neiworth (1987), and Hollard & Delius (1982) for further findings concerning mental rotation in animals.
Horikawa, T., Tamaki, M., Miyawaki, Y., & Kamitani, Y. (2013). Neural Decoding of Visual Imagery During Sleep. Science (340 #6132) 639-642.
Horne, P.V. (1993). The Nature of Imagery. Consciousness and Cognition (2) 58-82. Suggests that imagery arises when stored visual information is fed through the visual information processing system of the brain once again. The suggestion would appear to be consistent with the quasi-pictorial theory of Kosslyn, but provides much less detail. Printed together with several commentaries.
Hornsveld, H.K., Houtveen, J.H., Vroomen, M., Aalbers, I.K.D., Aalbers, D., & van den Hout M.A. (2011). Evaluating the Effect of Eye Movements on Positive Memories Such as Those Used in Resource Development and Installation. Journal of EMDR Practice and Research (5 #4) 146-155. Deliberately moving the eyes whilst maintaining a visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness and emotional impact of the image. This suggests that the eye movements observed during visual imagery (see Brandt & Stark (1997), and the other citations given in the comment on that article) play a real causal or constitutive role in imagery, and cannot be dismissed as mere epiphenomena. For further corroborating evidence, see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there. This particular study is of special interest, however, because most of these studies have looked only at the effects of horizontal eye movements on images with a negative, unpleasant emotional valence. (This is because they are mostly concerned with trying to understand the mechanisms behind EMDR, a psychotherapeutic technique that uses horizontal eye movements to reduce the emotional impact of the traumatic memories that give rise to PTSD.) This study, however, looked at emotionally pleasant images, and tested, separately, the effects of both horizontal and vertical deliberate eye movements. The effects were found to be much the same: both imagery vividness and emotional impact were reduced by each of the eye movement procedures.
Horowitz, M.J. (1970). Image Formation and Cognition. New York: Appelton. Largely concerned with the clinical relevance of imagery.
Horowitz, M.J. (1983). Image Formation and Psychotherapy. New York: Aronson. This is essentially a revised edition, somewhat more appropriately titled, of Horowitz (1970).
Horton, W.S., & Rapp, D.M. (2003). Out of Sight, out of Mind: Occlusion and the Accessibility of Information in Narrative Comprehension. Psychonomic Bulletin & Review (10) 104-110. Evidence that, in listening to stories, people visualize the scene from the perspective of the protagonist. Subjects remembered objects mentioned in the story more quickly, if they would have been visible from the protagonist's viewpoint.
Howard, R.J., ffytche, D.H., Barnes, J., McKeefry, D., Ha, Y., Woodruff, P.W., Bullmore, E.T., Simmons, A., Williams, S.C.R., David, A.S., & Brammer, M. (1998). The Functional Anatomy of Imagining and Perceiving Colour. NeuroReport (9) 1019–1023. Color imagery (by contrast with color perception) did not result in increased neural activity in retinotopically mapped brain areas (V1 and V4), but, rather, in "higher" centers.
Hume, D. (1740). A Treatise of Human Nature. (2nd Oxford edition, edited by L.A. Selby-Bigge & P.H. Nidditch. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1978.) Hume's ubiquitous ideas are, to all intents, mental images (but see Yolton (1996) for an alternative view).
Hume, D. (1748). An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. (Edition of E. Steinberg. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett, 1977.) Hume's ubiquitous ideas are, to all intents, mental images (but see Yolton (1996) for an alternative view).
Humphrey, G. (1951). Thinking. London: Methuen. Contains what is probably still the best account in English of the views of the influential imageless thought school of German introspective psychology, including translations from primary sources.
Humphrey, K. & Underwood, G. (2008). Fixation Sequences in Imagery and in Recognition During the Processing of Pictures of Real-world Scenes. Journal of Eye Movement Research (2 #2) Article 3: 1-15. Available online As the enactive theory of imagery might lead one to expect, the pattern of eye movements made during imagery resembles that which would be made during perception of the imagined scene, if it were actually present. For further evidence in support of this point see: Brandt & Stark (1997) and the other citations to be found in the comment on that article.
Hurovitz, C., Dunn, S., Domhoff, G. W., & Fiss, H. (1999). The Dreams of Blind Men and Women: a Replication and Extension of Previous Findings. Dreaming (9) 183-193. Reprint available online Study finds that people blind since birth or early childhood do not have visual imagery in their dreams, but have an abundance of imagery of other sensory modes.
Ichikawa, J. (2009). Dreaming and Imagination. Mind & Language (24 #1) 103-121. Argues that dreams are products of the imagination, and consist of a mixture of imagery and "propositional" imagining (i.e., imagining that such-and-such is the case, as opposed to falsely believing that such-and-such is the case). Follows McGinn (2004) in sharply distinguishing mental images from hallucinations, and in holding dreams to involve the former rather than the latter.
Ingle, D. (2002). Problems with a “Cortical Screen” for Visual Imagery. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 196-196.
Inoue, S. & Matsuzawa, T. (2007). Working Memory of Numerals in Chimpanzees. Current Biology (17 #23) R1004-R1005. Claims that chimpanzees may have a form of eidetic imagery (but see Cook & Wilson, 2010).
Intons-Peterson, M.J. (1983). Imagery Paradigms: How Vulnerable are They to Experimenter's Expectations? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (9) 394-412. A clear demonstration of the effects of demand characteristics on imagery experiments. Experimental results can be seriously distorted by even very subtle cues as to the experimenters' expectations.
Intons-Peterson, M.J. & Roskos-Ewoldsen, B.B. (1989). Sensory Perceptual Qualities of Images. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (15) 188-199.
Intons-Peterson, M.J. & White, A.R. (1981). Experimenter Naiveté and Imaginal Judgments. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (7 #4) 833-843. A critique of the work of Finke & Kurtzman (1981a,b). The results of these experiments on the "visual field of mental imagery" are likely due to experimenter effects (of the sort later demonstrated by Intons-Peterson (1983)). See Finke & Kurtzman (1981c) for a response.
Isaac, A.R. & Marks, D.F. (1994). Individual Diferences in Mental Imagery Experience: Developmental Changes and Specialization. British Journal of Psychology (85) 479-500. A study of variations in the reported vividness of visual and motor imagery according to sex, age, college subject specialization, and motor coordination. A surprisingly high proportion of "clumsy" children reported having no imagery at all, but, contrary to the influential claims of Galton (1880, 1883) (but consistent with the findings of Brewer & Schommer-Aikins (2006)) , the imagery of college students specializing in physics was no less vivid, on average, than that of students in non-science disciplines.
Ishai, A. (2010). Seeing with the Mind's Eye: Top-down, Bottom-up, and Conscious Awareness. F1000 Biology Reports (2 #34). Available online A brief overview of recent neuroimaging work (especially fMRI) on the neural substrate of mental imagery.
Ishai, A. & Sagi, D. (1995). Common Mechanisms of Visual Imagery and Perception. Science (268) 1772-1774.
Ishai, A. & Sagi, D. (1997). Visual Imagery: Effects of Short- and Long-Term Memory. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (9) 734-742.
Ishai, A. & Sagi, D. (1998). Visual Imagery and Visual Perception: The Role of Memory and Conscious Awareness. In S.R. Hameroff, A.W. Kaszniak & A.W. Scott (Eds.), Toward a Science of Consciousness II: The Second Tucson Discussions and Debates (pp. 321-328). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Ishai, A., Ungerleider, L.G., & Haxby, J.V. (2000). Distributed Neural Systems for the Generation of Visual Images. Neuron (28) 979-990. These results suggest that content-related activation during imagery in visual extrastriate cortex may be implemented by "top-down" mechanisms in parietal and frontal cortex.
Ishiguro, H. (1966). Imagination. In B.A.O. Williams & A. Montefiore (Eds.), British Analytical Philosophy (pp. 153-178). London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. Principally a discussion of Ryle's (1949) views. Not to be confused with Ishiguro (1967) where she presents her own original theory.
Ishiguro, H. (1967). Imagination. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume (41) 37-56. Images as intentional objects (in the sense of Anscombe 1965). Strongly influenced by Wittgenstein and Ryle.
Jacobs, L., Feldman, M., & Bender, M.B. (1972). Are the Eye Movements of Dreaming Sleep Related to the Visual Images of the Dreams? Psychophysiology (9) 393-401.
Jacobson, E. (1932). Electrophysiology of Mental Activities. American Journal of Psychology (44) 677-694. Evidence for stimulus-appropriate activity in the eye muscles during imagery.
Jaensch, E.R. (1930). Eidetic Imagery and Typological Methods of Investigation. (Translated from the German by O.A. Oeser.) London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. A seminal study of eidetic imagery, but seriously tainted by the racist assumptions of its Nazi milieu.
James, W. (1890). The Principles of Psychology. New York: Holt. Harvard University Press edition of 1983.
Janssen, J.A. & Sheikh, A.A. (1994). Enhancing Athletic Performance Through Imagery: An Overview. In A.A. Sheikh & E.R. Korn (Eds.) Imagery in Sports and Physical Performance (pp. 1-22). Amityville, NY: Baywood.
Janssen, W.H. (1976a). Selective Interference in Paired-Associate and Free Recall Learning: Messing up the Image. Acta Psychologia (40) 35-48.
Janssen, W. (1976b). On the Nature of Mental Imagery. Soesterburg, Netherlands: Institute for Perception TNO.
Jastrow, J. (1899). The Mind's Eye. Appleton's Popular Science Monthly (54) 299-312. The mind's eye and seeing-as (cf. Thomas, 1997a). This is also the paper that first introduced the duck-rabbit figure to philosophers (notably Wittgenstein) and psychologists (although Jastrow acknowledges that he did not originate it).
Jay, M. (1993). Downcast Eyes: The Denigration of Vision in Twentieth-Century French Thought. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press.
Jeannerod, M. (1994). The Representing Brain: Neural Correlates of Motor Intention and Imagery. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (17) 187-245.
Jeannerod, M. (1995). Mental Imagery in the Motor Context. Neuropsychologia (33) 1419-1432.
Jedlic, B., Hall, N., Munroe-Chandler, K., & Hall, C. (2007). Coaches' Encouragement of Athletes' Imagery Use. Research Quarterly for Exercise and Sport (78) 351-363. Most coaches encourage it strongly, especially for the more elite athletes.
Joanisse, M., Gagnon, S., Kreller, J., & Charbonneau, M.-C., (2008). Age-related Differences in Viewer-Rotation Tasks: Is Mental Manipulation the Key Factor? Journal of Gerontology: Psychological Sciences (63B #3) 193-200. Mental rotation abilities decline in old age.
Johansson, R.L. (2013). Tracking the Mind's Eye: Eye Movements During Mental Imagery and Memory Retrieval.Doctoral dissertation in Cognitive Science. Lund University, Sweden. Available online Describes the experiments published as Johansson et al. (2006, 2011, 2012) and Johansson & Johansson (2014).
Johansson, R., Holšánová, J., Dewhurst, R. & Holmqvist, K. (2012). Eye Movements During Pictorial Recall Have a Functional Role, but They Are Not Reinstatements of Those from Encoding. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (38 #5) 1289-1314. Patterns of eye movement during imagery are similar to those in visual perception of the same scene. (See also Johansson et al. (2010). See the comment on Brandt & Stark (1997) for the significance of this, and for citations to other related work.
Johansson, R., Holšánová, J., & Holmqvist, K. (2005). What Do Eye Movements Reveal About Mental Imagery? Evidence From Visual and Verbal Elicitations. In B.G. Bara, L. Barsalou, & M. Bucciarelli (Eds.), Proceedings of the 27th Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society (pp. 1054-1059). Mahwah, NJ: Erlbaum. Preprint available online in PDF See next comment, on Johansson et al. (2006).
Johansson, R., Holšánová J., & Holmqvist, K. (2006). Pictures and Spoken Descriptions Elicit Similar Eye Movements During Mental Imagery, Both in Light and in Complete Darkness. Cognitive Science (30) 1053-1079. Reprint available online in PDF Direct support for the enactive theory of imagery (Thomas, 1999b). For further related evidence, see Brandt & Stark (1997), and Laeng & Teodorescu (2002) (and the further references in the accompanying comments).
Johansson, R., Holšánová, J., & Holmqvist, K. (2010). Eye Movements During Mental Imagery are Not Reenactments of Perception. In S. Ohlsson & R. Catrambone (Eds.), Cognition in Flux: Proceedings of the 32nd Annual Meeting of the Cognitive Science Society, Portland, Oregon, 2010 (pp. 1968-1973). Red Hook, NY: Curran Associates. Available online Subjects either heard a verbal description of a scene or viewed a picture with eyes fixated, then they formed an image of the scene depicted or described whilst looking at a blank screeen. Eye movements during imagery resembled those they would have made if freely viewing the depicted scene (as predicted by the enactive theory of imagery). See Brandt & Stark (1997), and the citations in the comment accompanying it, for further corroboration.
Johansson, R., Holšánová, J., & Holmqvist, K. (2011). The Dispersion of Eye Movements During Visual Imagery is Related to Individual Differences in Spatial Imagery Ability. In L. Carlson, C. Hoelscher, & T.F. Shipley (Eds.), Proceedings of the 33rd Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society (pp. 1200-1205). Austin, TX: Cognitive Science Society. Available online
Johansson, R. & Johansson, M. (2014) Look Here, Eye Movements Play a Functional Role in Memory Retrieval. Psychological Science (25 #1) 236-242. More evidence to confirm that eye movements play a functional role in visual mental imagery, and are not a mere epiphenomenon. For further relevant evidence, see Brandt & Stark (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment thereto.
Johnson, M. (1987). The Body in the Mind: The Bodily Basis of Meaning, Imagination and Reason. Chicago: University of Chicago Press. Cognitive metaphor theory and the concept of image schema. See also Lakoff & Johnson (1980, 1999).
Johnson-Laird, P.N. (1998). Imagery, Visualization, and Thinking. In J. Hochberg (Ed.), Perception and Cognition at the Century's End (pp. 441-467). San Diego, CA: Academic Press.
Jolicoeur, P. & Kosslyn, S.M. (1985). Demand Characteristics in Image Scanning Experiments. Journal of Mental Imagery (9) 41-50.
Jones, G.V. (1986). Lexical Imagery and Semantics. In D.G. Russell, D.F. Marks & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.) Imagery 2 (pp. 67-71). Dunedin, New Zealand: Human Performance Associates. Argues that it is differences in the predicability rather than in the imagery value (Paivio, 1971; Paivio, Yuille & Madigan, 1968) of words that accounts for their differential memorability.
Jonides, J., Kahn, R., & Rozin, P. (1975). Imagery Instructions Improve Memory in Blind Subjects. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (5) 424-6. Instructions to use imagery mnemonics (that had been assumed to work in sighted subjects by inducing them to form visual imagery) seem to just as effective in improving memory performance when they are given to congenitally blind subjects (cf. Zimler & Keenan, 1983; and see also: Marmor & Zaback, 1976; Carpenter & Eisenberg, 1978; Kerr, 1983).
Jonikaitis, D., Deubel, H., & de’Sperati, C. (2009). Time Gaps in Mental Imagery Introduced by Competing Saccadic Tasks. Vision Research (49) 2164-2175. Conscious voluntary saccades made during an imagery task delay completion of the task, presumably because they interfere with the pattern of the spontaneous, unconscious saccades that accompany and perhaps partially constitute normal visual imagery. On the role of saccades in visual imagery see Brandt & Stark (1997) and the citations listed in the comment thereto; for further evidence about how competing saccades interfere with imagery see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in its comment.
Juhasz, J.B. (1969). Imagining, Imitation and Role Taking. Doctoral Thesis. University of California Berkeley.
Juhasz, J.B. (1971). Greek Theories of Imagination. Journal of the History of the Behavioral Sciences (7) 39-58.
Juhasz, J.B. (1972). An Experimental Study of Imagining. Journal of Personality (40) 588-600. Derives support for a version of enactive theory (Sarbin & Juhasz, 1970; Sarbin, 1972) from a study of individual differences.
Julstrom, B. A., & Baron, R. J. (1985). A Model of Mental Imagery. International Journal of Man-Machine Studies (23) 313-334. A connectionist implementation of a quasi-pictorial theory of imagery.
Just, M.A. & Carpenter, P.A. (1976). Eye Fixations and Cognitive Processes. Cognitive Psychology (8) 441-480. A study of the Shepard & Metzler (1971) mental rotation task. See also Carpenter & Just (1976).
Just, M.A., Newman, S.D., Keller, T.A., McEleney, A., & Carpenter, P.A. (2004). Imagery in sentence comprehension: an fMRI study. NeuroImage (21) 112- 124.
Kan, I.P., Barsalou, L.W., Solomon, K.O., Minor, J.K., & Thompson-Schill, S.L. (2003). Role of Mental Imagery in a Property Verification Task: fMRI Evidence for Perceptual Representations of Conceptual Knowledge. Cognitive Neuropsychology (20) 525-540. Experimental and neuroimaging evidence that conceptual knowledge is encoded in the form of perceptual representations (Barsalou, 1999) or imagery, rather than as “amodal” mentalese representations.
Kant, I. (1781/1787). Critique of Pure Reason. (Edited and translated from the 1st and 2nd German editions by N.K. Smith, London: Macmillan, 2nd edn. 1933.)
Kasem, A. (1989). Can Berkeley Be Called an Imagist? Indian Philosophical Quarterly (6 ) 75-88.
Kaski, D. (2002). Revision: Is Visual Perception a Requisite for Visual Imagery? Perception (31) 717-731. Review article considering whether, or to what degree, the neural structures that subserve visual imagery are the same as those that subserve visual perception.
Kaufman, L., Schwarz, B., Salustri, C., & Williamson, S. (1990). Modulation of Spontaneous Brain Activation During Mental Imagery. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (2) 124-132. A magnetoencephalography (MEG) study of a cognitive task that supposedly involved visual mental imagery. Suppression of alpha-wave activity was observed in the region of the visual cortex, suggesting that this bran region plays a role in visual imagery.
Kaufmann, G. (1980). Imagery, Language and Cognition. Oslo, Norway: Universitetsforlaget. Psychological study of imagery in problem solving. Suggests that the intentionality of mental imagery derives from that of natural language.
Kaufmann, G. (1981). What is Wrong with Imagery Questionnaires? Scandinavian Journal of Psychology (22) 59-64. Questions the usefulness and validity of introspective questionnaires, such as the VVIQ of Marks (1973), that attempt to assess characteristic differences between the vividness of different people's imagery. See also: Marks (1983a, 1983b, 1989, 1999), Kaufmann (1983), Chara & Verplanck (1986), McKelvie (1995), Schwitzgebel (2002a), Dean & Morris (2003).
Kaufmann, G. (1983). How Good are Imagery Questionnaires? A Rejoinder to David Marks. Scandinavian Journal of Psychology (24) 247-249. A reply to Marks (1983b), which itself was a reply to Kaufmann (1981). Kaufmann questions the usefulness and validity of introspective questionnaires, such as the VVIQ of Marks (1973), that attempt to assess characteristic differences between the vividness of different people's imagery. See also: Marks (1983a, 1989, 1999), Chara & Verplanck (1986), McKelvie (1995), Schwitzgebel (2002a), Dean & Morris (2003).
Kavanagh, D.J., Andrade, J., & May, J. (2005). Imaginary Relish and Exquisite Torture: The Elaborated Intrusion Theory of Desire. Psychological Review (112) 446-467. Argues that imagery plays a key role in the psychology of desire (as did Aristotle). See also Andrade et al. (2009).
Kavanagh, D.J., Freese, S., Andrade, J., & May, J. (2001). Effects of Visuospatial Tasks on Desensitization to Emotive Memories. British Journal of Clinical Psychology (40) 267-280. Consistent with the results of numerous other studies, it was found that making deliberate eye movements whilst entertaining an emotionally distressing visual image led to a reduction in both the vividness and emotional impact of the image when later recalled. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations given in the comment thereto.
Kearney, R. (1988). The Wake of Imagination: Ideas of Creativity in Western Culture. London: Hutchinson.
Keilkopf, C.F. (1968). The Pictures in the Head of a Man Born Blind. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (28) 501-513.
Keenan, J.M. (1983). Qualifications and Clarifications of Images of Concealed Objects: A Reply to Kerr and Neisser. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory and Cognition (9) 222-230. Defends the work of Keenan & Moore (1979) against the criticism of Kerr & Neisser (1983).
Keenan, J.M. & Moore, R.E. (1979). Memory of Concealed Objects: A Reexamination of Neisser and Kerr. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Learning and Memory (5) 374-385. Fails to replicate, and rejects, the results of Neisser & Kerr (1973). However, Kerr & Neisser (1983) were able to replicate their original results and suggest an explanation as to why Keenan & Moore failed to do so (but see Keenan, 1983).
Kemps, E., & Tiggemann, M. (2007). Reducing the Vividness and Emotional Impact of Distressing Autobiographical Memories: The Importance of Modality-Specific Interference. Memory (15) 412-422. Consistent with the results of numerous other studies, it was found that making deliberate eye movements whilst entertaining an emotionally distressing visual image led to a reduction in both the vividness and emotional impact of the image when later recalled. Similar effects on auditory imagery were also found when using a phonological task (articulatory suppression). For further corroboration of the effects of eye movements on visual imagery, see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations given in the comment thereto.
Keogh, R. & Pearson, J. (2011). Mental Imagery and Visual Working Memory. PLoS One (6 #12), e29221. Available online
Kerr, N.H. (1983). The Role of Vision in “Visual Imagery” Experiments: Evidence from the Congenitally Blind. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (112) 265-77. Many “classic” experimental effects attributed to imagery can be reproduced in blind subjects.
Kerr, N.H. (1987). Locational Representation in Mental Imagery: The Third Dimension. Memory and Cognition (15) 521-530.
Kerr, N. (1993). Mental Imagery, Dreams, and Perception. In D. Foulkes & C. Cavallero (Eds.), Dreaming as Cognition (pp. 18-37). New York: Harvester-Wheatsheaf.
Kerr, N.H. (2000) Dreaming, Imagery and Perception. In M.H. Kryger, T. Roth, & W.C. Dement (Eds.), Principles and Practice of Sleep Medicine (3rd edn.) (pp. 482-490). Philadelphia: Saunders.
Kerr, N.H. & Domhoff, G.W. (2004). Do the Blind Literally “See” in Their Dreams? A Critique of a Recent Claim That They Do. Dreaming (14) 230-233. Preprint available online
Kerr, N.H., Foulkes, D., & Schmidt, M. (1982). The Structure of Laboratory Dream Reports in Blind and Sighted Subjects. Journal of Nervous and Mental Disease (170) 286-294.
Kerr, N.H. & Neisser, U. (1983). Mental Images of Concealed Objects: New Evidence. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory and Cognition (9) 212-221. A replication of Neisser & Kerr (1973), and a response to Keenan & Moore (1979). See also Keenan (1983).
Kessel, F.S. (1972). Imagery: A Dimension of Mind Rediscovered. British Journal of Psychology (63) 149-62.
Kieras, D. (1978). Beyond Pictures and Words: Alternative Information-processing Models for Imagery Effects in Verbal Memory. Psychological Bulletin (85) 532-554. Argues that something like Dual Coding Theory may still be correct even though imagery may ultimately be reducible to “propositional” (mentalese) descriptions.
Kind, A. (2001). Putting the Image back in Imagination. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (62) 85-109. Argues (against the claims of certain 20th century analytical philosophers) that there is a conceptual connection between imagery and creative imagination. Cf. Thomas (1997a).
Kintsch, W. (1977). Memory and Cognition. New York: Wiley. Cf. Flanagan (1984).
Klatzky, R.L., Lederman, S.J., & Matula D.E. (1991).Imagined Haptic Exploration in Judgements of Object Properties. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (17) 314-322. A rare study of haptic imagery .
Klein, I., Dubois,J., Mangin, J.-F., Kherif, F., Flandin, G., Poline, J.-B., Denis, M., Kosslyn, S.M., & Le Bihan, D. (2004). Retinotopic Organization of Visual Mental Images as Revealed by Functional Magnetic Resonance Imaging. Cognitive Brain Research (22 #1) 26-31. See comment on Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson (2001).
Kleiter, I., Luerding, R., Diendorfer, G., Rek, H., Bogdahn, U., & Schalke, B. (2007). A Lightning Strike to the Head Causing a Visual Cortex Defect with Simple and Complex Visual Hallucinations. Journal of Neurology, Neurosurgery, and Psychiatry (78) 423-426. The victim experienced complex visual hallucinations despite damage to much of her visual cortex, which caused blindness over much of her visual field. See Bridge et al. (2012) and the citations listed in the comment thereto, for further evidence that destruction of early visual cortex, although it leads to blindness, often does not lead to impaired visual imagery, and may give rise to hallucinations in the blinded areas of the visual field.
Klüver, H. (1932). Eidetic Phenomena. Psychological Bulletin (29 #3) 181-203. A skeptical review of the early 20th century literature on eidetic imagery.
Knauff, M. & May, E. (2006). Mental Imagery, Reasoning, and Blindness. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology: Section A: Human Experimental Psychology (59) 161-177. Preprint available online
Kobayashi, M., Takeda, M., Hattori, N., Fukunaga, M., Sasabe, T., Inoue, N., Nagai, Y,. Sawada, T., Sadato, N., & Watanabe, Y. (2004). Functional Imaging of Gustatory Perception and Imagery: "Top-Down" Processing of Gustatory Signals. NeuroImage (23) 1271-1282. An fMRI study of gustatory (taste) imagery that shows the involvement of to-down signals and the involvement of such brain areas as the left insula and middle and superior frontal gyri.
Köhler, C., Hoffmann, K.P., Dehnhardt, G., & Mauck, B. (2005). Mental Rotation and Rotational Invariance in the Rhesus Monkey (Macaca mulatta). Brain, Behavior and Evolution (66) 158-166. Some rare (but weak) direct empirical evidence for the occurrence of imagery in animals. One of three monkeys tested appeared to be doing mental rotation in a humanlike way (i.e., producing a linear relationship between judgement time and rotational angle, which has been taken as a sign of imagery use in humans), but two others did not. See also Hollard & Delius (1982), Rilling & Neiworth (1987), and Hopkins et al. (1993).
Kokoszka, A., Domosławski, J., Wallace, B., & Borzym, A. (2000). Preliminary Evidence for Diurnal Fluctuations in Visual Imagery. International Journal of Neuroscience (101) 1-7. Subjective imagery vividness (as measured by the VVIQ questionnaire (Marks, 1973) appears to vary with time of day.
Kolers, P.A. (1987). Imaging. In R.L. Gregory & O.L. Zangwill (Eds.), The Oxford Companion to the Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kolers, P.A. & Smythe, W.E. (1979). Images, Symbols, and Skills. Canadian Journal of Psychology (33) 158-184.
Kölmel, H.W. (1985). Complex Visual Hallucinations in the Hemianopic Field. Journal of Neurology, Neurosurgery, and Psychiatry (48) 29-38. Brain damaged patients who have hallucinations in those parts of the visual field corresponding to where they are blind due to parts of their brain's retinotopic maps having been damaged. This strongly suggests that the retinotopic maps are not essential for imagery. For similar findings see the citations in the comment on Zago et al. (2010).
Korn, E.R. & Johnson, K. (1983). Visualization: The Uses of Imagery in the Health Professions. Homewood, IL: Dow Jones-Irwin.
Koshino, H., Carpenter, P.A., Keller, T.A., & Just, M.A. (2005). Interactions Between the Dorsal and the Ventral Pathways in Mental Rotation: An fMRI Study. Cognitive Affective & Behavioral Neuroscience (5) 54-66. Multiple brain regions are involved in mental rotation.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1973). Scanning Visual Images: Some Structural Implications. Perception and Psychophysics (14) 90-94.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1975). Information Representation in Visual Images. Cognitive Psychology (7) 341-370. As well as describing an experiment demonstrating that imagery mental representations are functionally distinct from verbal ones, this also contains the first published statement of Kosslyn's CRT (Cathode Ray Tube) display theory of imagery, based on the analogy with computer graphics programs, which evolved into his quasi-pictorial theory of imagery.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1976a). Can Imagery be Distinguished from Other Forms of Internal Representation? Evidence from Studies of Information Retrieval Times. Memory and Cognition (4) 291-297.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1976b). Using Imagery to Retrieve Semantic Information: a Developmental Study. Child Development (47) 434-444.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1978a). Measuring the Visual Angle of the Mind's Eye. Cognitive Psychology (10) 356-389.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1978b). Imagery and Internal Representation. In E. Rosch & B.B. Lloyd (Eds.), Cognition and Categorization. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1980). Image and Mind. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press. Detailed and seminal statement and defense of the computational version of quasi-pictorial theory of imagery, which has been extremely influential. See Kosslyn (1981) and Kosslyn, Pinker, Smith, & Shwartz (1979) for more concise accounts.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1981). The Medium and the Message in Mental Imagery: A Theory. Psychological Review (88) 46-66.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1983). Ghosts in the Mind's Machine: Creating and Using Images in the Brain. New York: Norton. A popularization of the quasi-pictorial theory.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1987). Seeing and Imagining in the Cerebral Hemispheres: A Computational Approach. Psychological Review (94) 148-75.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1992). Cognitive Neuroscience and the Human Self. In A. Harrington (Ed.). So Human a Brain: Knowledge and Values in the Neurosciences. New York: Pergamon. Deals with the relevance of imagery to a person's conception of their self, and also attempts to account for the fact that imagery (conceived as quasi-pictorial representation) is consciously experienced (see also, Kosslyn, 2001). See Thomas (2009) for a critical discussion of Kosslyn's views on this latter topic.
Kosslyn, S.M. (1994). Image and Brain: The Resolution of the Imagery Debate. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Updates the quasi-pictorial theory with an account of how imagery may be neurologically embodied. For a more concise (and more recent) account see Kosslyn (2005).
Kosslyn, S.M. (2001). Visual Consciousness. In P. Grossenbacher (Ed.) Finding Consciousness in the Brain (pp 79-103). Amsterdam: John Benjamins. Reprint available online An attempt to account for the fact that imagery (conceived as quasi-pictorial representation) is consciously experienced (see also, Kosslyn, 1992). See Thomas (2009) for a critical discussion of Kosslyn's views on this topic.
Kosslyn, S.M. (2005). Mental Images and the Brain. Cognitive Neuropsychology (22) 333-347. A recent re-statement of quasi-pictorial theory.
Kosslyn, S.M., Alpert, N. M., Thompson, W. L., Maljkovic, V., Weise, S. B., Chabris, C. F., Hamilton, S. E., Rauch, S. L., & Buonanno, F. S. (1993). Visual mental imagery activates topographically organized visual cortex: PET investigations. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (5) 263-287. See annotation to Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson (2001).
Kosslyn, S.M., Ball, T.M., & Reiser, B.J. (1978). Visual Images Preserve Metric Spatial Information: Evidence from Studies of Image Scanning. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (4) 47-60. Extensive and well known study of the mental scanning phenomenon.
Kosslyn, S.M., Behrmann, M., & Jeannerod, M. (Eds.) (1995). The Cognitive Neuroscience of Mental Imagery. Neuropsychologia special issue (33, #11).
Kosslyn, S.M. & Dror, I.E. (1992). A Cognitive Neuroscience of Alzheimer’s disease. What can be Learned from Studies of Visual Imagery? In Y. Christen & P. Churchland (Eds.). Neurophilosophy and Alzheimer’s Disease (pp. 49-59). Berlin & New York: Springer-Verlag. doi:10.1007/978-3-642-46759-2_5
Kosslyn, S.M., Flynn, R.A., Amsterdam, J.B., & Wang, G. (1990). Components of High-Level Vision: A Cognitive Neuroscience Analysis and Accounts of Neurological Syndromes. Cognition (34) 203-277.
Kosslyn, S.M., Ganis, G., & Thompson, W.L., (2001). Neural Foundations of Imagery. Nature Reviews: Neuroscience (2) 635-642. A review of the evidence, from many studies (many of which have Kosslyn as a co-author), that suggest that imagery depends on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain (see also Klein et al., 2004). However, there is also much evidence that seems to contradict this conclusion (e.g., Roland & Gulyàs, 1994; Trojano & Grossi, 1994; Mellet et al., 1996; D'Esposito et al., 1997; Bartolomeo et al., 1997; Bartolomeo et al., 1998; Goldenberg, 1998; Howard et al., 1998; Goebel et al.,1998; Bartolomeo, 2002; Dulin et al., 2008; Zago et al., 2010; Bridge et al., 2012; Bartolomeo et al., 2013). (The literature on each side of this issue is now very large, and cannot all practicably be listed here.) For a review of both lines of evidence, and an attempted reconciliation of the contradictions, see Kosslyn & Thompson (2003). Note, however, that, despite what the authors of this article wish to imply, even if it is true that retinotopically mapped visual cortex is always activated during visual imagery, it does not necessarily follow that quasi-pictorial theory is true. Other imagery theories can readily account for it (Thomas, 1999b; Abell & Currie, 1999; Pylyshyn, 2002a,b 2003a,b; Dulin et al., 2008; Bartolomeo et al., 2013). On the other hand, if this region of cortex is never, or only sometimes, activated during visual imagery (as some claim), that would appear to raise a problem for at least the more recent, neurologically specific versions of quasi-pictorial theory (Kosslyn, 1994, 2005; Kosslyn, Thompson, & Ganis, 2006).
Kosslyn, S.M., Ganis, G. & Thompson, W.L. (2003). Mental imagery: Against the Nihilistic Hypothesis. Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7, #3) 109-111. A response to Pylyshyn (2003a). Pylyshyn (2003c) responds to this.
Kosslyn, S.M., Ganis, G., & Thompson, W.L. (2004). Mental Imagery: Depictive Accounts. In R. L. Gregory (Ed.), The Oxford Companion to the Mind (2nd edn.). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kosslyn, S.M., Ganis, G., & Thompson, W.L. (2010). Multimodal Images in the Brain. In A. Guillot & C. Collet (Eds.), The Neurophysiological Foundations of Mental and Motor Imagery (pp. 3-16). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Hatfield, G. (1984). Representation Without Symbol Systems. Social Research (51) 1019-1045.
Kosslyn, S.M., Holyoak, K.J., & Huffman, C.S. (1976). A Processing Approach to the Dual Coding Hypothesis. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Learning and Memory (2) 223-233.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Koenig, O. (1992). Wet Mind: The New Cognitive Neuroscience. New York: The Free Press.
Kosslyn, S. M. & Moulton, S. T. (2009). Mental Imagery and Implicit Memory. In K.D. Markman, W.M.P Klein, & J.A. Suhr (Eds.), Handbook of Imagination and Mental Simulation (pp. 135-151). Hove U.K.: Psychology Press.
Kosslyn, S.M., Murphy, G.L., Bemesderfer, M.E. & Feinstein, K.J. (1977). Category and Continuum in Mental Comparisons. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (106) 341-375. Experimental support for Dual Coding Theory from the symbolic distance effect. (Cf. Paivio, 1975b, 1978a, 1978b).
Kosslyn, S.M., Pascual-Leone, A., Felician, O., Camposano, S., Keenan, J.P., Thompson, W.L., Ganis, G., Sukel, K.E. & Alpert, N.M. (1999). The Role of Area 17 in Visual Imagery: Convergent Evidence from PET and rTMS. Science (284) 167-170. See annotation to Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson (2001).
Kosslyn, S.M., Pinker, S., Smith, G.E., & Shwartz, S.P. (1979). On the Demystification of Mental Imagery. Behavioral & Brain Sciences (2) 535-581. A defense of the quasi-pictorial theory of imagery, with commentaries and reply.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Pomerantz, J.R. (1977). Imagery, Propositions and the Form of Internal Representations. Cognitive Psychology (9) 52-76. A defence of quasi-pictorial theory against Pylyshyn's (1973) criticisms, and a critique of the alternative propositional (description) theory.
Kosslyn, S.M., Reisberg, D., & Behrmann, M. (2006). Introspection and Mechanism in Mental Imagery. In A. Harrington & A. Zajonc (Eds.) The Dalai Lama at MIT (pp. 79-90). Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Kosslyn, S.M., Shephard, J.M., & Thompson, W.L. (2007). Spatial Processing during Mental Imagery: A Neurofunctional Theory. In: F. Mast and L. Jäncke (Eds), Spatial Processing in Navigation, Imagery and Perception (pp. 1-15). New York: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-0-387-71978-8_1
Kosslyn, S.M., Shin, L.M., Thompson, W.L., McNally, R.J., Rauch, S.L., Pitman, R.K., & Alpert, N.M. (1996). Neural Effects of Visualizing and Perceiving Aversive Stimuli: A PET Investigation. NeuroReport (7 #10) 1569-1576.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Shwartz, S.P. (1977). A Simulation of Visual Imagery. Cognitive Science (1) 265-295. Computer model of the quasi-pictorial theory.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Shwartz, S.P. (1978). Visual Images as Spatial Representations in Active Memory. In A.R. Hanson & E.M. Riseman (Eds.), Computer Vision Systems. New York: Academic Press. Another description of their computer model of the quasi-pictorial theory.
Kosslyn, S.M., Sukel, K.E., & Bly, B.M. (1999). Squinting with the Mind's Eye: Effects of Stimulus Resolution on Imaginal and Perceptual Comparisons. Memory and Cognition (19) 276-282.
Kosslyn, S.M. & Thompson, W.L. (2003). When is Early Visual Cortex Activated During Visual Imagery? Psychological Bulletin (129) 723-746. Attempts to reconcile conflicting findings as to whether retinotopically mapped areas of visual cortex, especially V1, are activated during visual imagery (see comment on Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson, 2001).
Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson, W.L., & Ganis, G. (2002). Mental Imagery Doesn’t Work like That. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 198-200.
Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson, W.L., & Ganis, G. (2006). The Case for Mental Imagery. Oxford: Oxford University Press. A relatively succinct and accessible (but also distinctly tendentious) book length defense of Kosslyn's quasi-pictorial theory of imagery.
Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson, W.L., Kim, I.J., & Alpert, N.M. (1995). Topographical Representation of Mental Images in Primary Visual Cortex. Nature (378) 496-498. See annotation to Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson (2001).
Kosslyn, S.M., Thompson. W.L., Sukel, K.E., & Alpert, N.M. (2005). Two Types of Image Generation: Evidence from PET. Cognitive Affective & Behavioral Neuroscience (5) 41-53. Subtly different patterns of brain activation are found according to whether images are formed entirely on the basis of verbal descriptions, or after viewing pictures of parts that will then be mentally assembled into a full image. It is claimed that this result is inconsistent with the enactive (perceptual activity) theory of imagery, but this applies only to a strawman version of the theory, held by no-one.
Koulack, D. (1972). Rapid Eye Movements and Visual Imagery During Sleep. Psychological Bulletin (78) 155-158. Review article.
Kozhevnikov, M., Hegarty, M., & Mayer R.E. (2002). Revising the Visualizer-Verbalizer Dimension: Evidence for Two Types of Visualizers. Cognition and Instruction (20) 47-77.
Krause, B.J., Schmidt, D., Mottaghy, F.M., Taylor, J., Halsband, U., Herzog, H., Tellmann, L., & Müller-Gärtner, H.-W. (1999). Episodic Retrieval Activates the Precuneus Irrespective of the Imagery Content of Word Pair Associates: A PET Study. Brain (122 #2) 255-263. A rebuttal of the claims made by Fletcher et al. (1995), that the precuneus plays a key role in memory imagery. It is argued that the precuneus is involved in all episodic memory, imagistic or otherwise.
Kreiman, G., Koch C., & Freid, G. (2000). Imagery Neurons in the Human Brain. Nature (408) 357-361.
Kubler, G. (1985). Eidetic Imagery and Paleolithic Art. Journal of Psychology (119 #6) 557-565. Suggests that paleolithic cave paintings are evidence of eidetic imagery in prehistoric man.
Kunen, S. & May, J.G. (1980). Spatial Frequency Content of Visual Imagery. Perception and Psychophysics (28) 555-559.
Kunzendorf, R.G. (1982). Mental Images, Appreciation of Grammatical Patterns, and Creativity. Journal of Mental Imagery (6) 183-202.
Kunzendorf, R.G. (1984). Centrifugal Effects of Eidetic Imaging on Flash Electroretinograms and Autonomic Responses. Journal of Mental Imagery (8) 67-76. Evidence that very vivid mental imagery may sometimes involve neural activity within the retina of the eye itself. See also: Kunzendorf, Justice, & Capone (1997).
Kunzendorf, R.G. (1990). Mind-Brain Identity Theory: A Materialistic Foundation for the Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery. In R.G. Kunzendorf & A.A. Sheikh (Eds.), The Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery: Theory, Research and Application (pp. 9-36). Amityville, NY: Baywood.
Kunzendorf, R.G. (1991a). The Causal Efficacy of Consciousness in General, Imagery in Particular: A Materialistic Perspective. In R.G. Kunzendorf (ed.) Mental Imagery (pp. 147-157). New York: Plenum Press.
Kunzendorf, R.G. (Ed.) (1991b). Mental Imagery. (Proceedings of the 11th Conference of the American Association for the Study of Mental Imagery, Washington, D.C., 1989). New York: Plenum Press.
Kunzendorf, R.G., Justice, M., & Capone, D. (1997). Conscious Images as “Centrally Excited Sensations”: A Developmental Study of Imaginal Influences on the ERG. Journal of Mental Imagery (21) 155-166.
Kunzendorf, R.G. & Sheikh, A.A. (Eds.) (1990). The Psychophysiology of Mental Imagery: Theory, Research and Application. Amityville, NY: Baywood.
Kwekkeboom, K.L. (2000). Measuring Imaging Ability: Psychometric Testing of the Imaging Ability Questionnaire. Research in Nursing & Health (23) 301-309.
Lacey, S. & Lawson, R. (eds.) (2013). Multisensory Imagery. New York: Springer.
Laeng, B., Bloem, I.M., D’Ascenzo, S., & Tommasi, L. (2014). Scrutinizing Visual Images: the Role of Gaze in Mental Imagery and Memory. Cognition (131 #2) 263-283. Evidence that enactment of the eye movements that would be appropriate for viewing some particular pattern or object also plays a functional role in the imagining of that pattern or object. For further evidence of this, see Brandt & Stark (1997) and the citations listed in the comment thereto.
Laeng, B., & Sulutvedt, U. (2013). The Eye Pupil Adjusts to Imaginary Light. Psychological Science (25 #1) 188-197. Further evidence that visual mental imagery involves enaction of the relevant perceptual processes by the visual system as a whole. In this case we have evidence that pupilliary contraction and dilation during imagery parallels that which occurs during actual seeing of things of different brightness.
Laeng, B. & Teodorescu, D.-S. (2002). Eye Scanpaths During Visual Imagery Reenact those of Perception of the Same Visual Scene. Cognitive Science (26) 207-231. Reprint available online Replicates and extends the findings of Brandt & Stark (1997), and also shows that deliberately suppressing spontaneous eye movements interferes with imagery, thus providing direct experimental support for the enactive theory of imagery (Hebb, 1968; Neisser, 1976; Thomas, 1999b). For further evidence to this effect, see the citations listed in the comment on Brandt & Stark (1997).
Lakoff, G. & Johnson, M. (1999). Philosophy in the Flesh. New York: Basic Books. Cognitive metaphor theory and image schemata. See also Lakoff & Johnson (1980) and Johnson (1987).
Lambert, S., Sampaio, E., Mauss, Y., & Scheiber, C. (2004). Blindness and Brain Plasticity: Contribution of Mental Imagery? An fMRI Study. Cognitive Brain Research (20) 1-11. Imagery in congenitally blind subjects (presumably haptic/tactile imagery) is accompanied by activation of the primary visual area of the brain (V1). See De Volder et al. (2001) for more on the neuroscience of imagery in the congenitally blind.
Lance, J.W. (1976). Simple Formed Hallucinations Confined to the Area of a Specific Visual Field Defect. Brain (99) 719-734. Describes certain brain damaged patients who have hallucinations in those parts of the visual field corresponding to where they are blind due to parts of their brain's retinotopic mapped regions having been destroyed. This strongly suggests that (contrary to Kosslyn's (1994, 2005; Kosslyn, Thompson, & Ganis, 2006) claims) activation of the retinotopically mapped areas of the brain are not essential to the experience of visual imagery. For further corroboratory evidence see Bridge et al. (2012) and the other material cited in the comment thereto.
Lang, P.J. (1979). A Bio-Informational Theory of Emotional Imagery. Psychophysiology (16) 495-512. A version of the description or “propositional” theory of imagery.
Langland-Hassan P. (2011). A Puzzle about Visualization. Phenomenology and the Cognitive Sciences (10 #2) 145-173.
Lawrie, R. (1970). The Existence of Mental Images. Philosophical Quarterly (20) 253-7.
Lay, W. (1898). Mental Imagery: Experimentally and Subjectively Considered. Unpublished doctoral dissertation, Columbia University, New York. [Columbia University Contributions to Philosophy and Psychology, Vol.4 #2.] A study from the era of experimental introspection.
Leclair-Visonneau, L., Oudiette, D., Gaymard, B., Leu-Semenescu, S., & Arnulf, I. (2010). Do the Eyes Scan Dream Images During Rapid Eye Movement Sleep? Evidence from the Rapid Eye Movement Sleep Behaviour Disorder Model. Brain (133) 1737-1746. These findings suggest that the REMs of REM sleep do indeed arise because the eyes are scanning dream images at these times. Presumably the REMs are analogous to the eye movements observed during waking visual imagery (see Brandt & Stark (1997) and the other material cited in the comment thereto), which enact the scanning of the imagined scene.
Lee, C.W., & Drummond, P.D. (2008). Effects of Eye Movement Versus Therapist Instructions on the Processing of Distressing Memories. Journal of Anxiety Disorders (22 #5) 801-808.
Lee, J.-H., Marzelli, M., Jolesz, F.A., & Yoo, S.-S. (2009). Automated Classification of fMRI Data Employing Trial-based Imagery Tasks. Medical Image Analysis (13) 392-404. It was found to be possible to distinguish reasonably reliably between 6 types of imagery just from fMRI data. The types were: right-hand motor imagery, left-hand motor imagery, right foot motor imagery, mental calculation, internal speech/word generation, and visual imagery.
Lee, L.H. & Olness, K.N. (1996). Effects of Self-induced Mental Imagery on Autonomic Reactivity in Children. Journal of Developmental and Behavioral Pediatrics (17) 323-327.
Lenox, J.R., Lange, A.F., & Graham, K.R. (1970). Eye Movement Amplitudes in Imagined Pursuit of a Pendulum with Eyes Closed. Psychophysiology (6) 773-777.
Levin, S.L., Mohamed, F.B., & Platek, S.M. (2005). Common Ground for Spatial Cognition? A Behavioral and fMRI Study of Sex Differences in Mental Rotation and Spatial Working Memory. Evolutionary Psychology (3) 227-254. Available online
Levine, D.N., Calvanio, R., & Popovics, A. (1982). Language in the Absence of Inner Speech. Neuropsychologia (20) 391-409. A stroke patient who had lost both the ability to speak and to imagine speaking was nevertheless shown still to be able to understand spoken and written language, to write, and to reason and calculate at near normal levels. His preserved abilities seemed to depend mainly on his use of visual mental imagery (including imagery of written words).
Levine, D.N., Warach, J., & Farah, M. (1985). Two Visual Systems in Mental Imagery: Dissociation of “What” and “Where” in Imagery Disorder Due to Bilateral Posterior Cerebral Lesions. Neurology (35) 1010-1018.
Lewis, K.J.S., Borst, G., and Kosslyn, S.M. (2011). Integrating Images and Percepts: New Evidence for Depictive Representation. Psychological Research, 75, 259-271. An experiment in which subjects show that they can combine or overlay information represented in an image with a current percept. The claim, however, that this constitutes positive evidence for a depictive theory of imagery, and against a descriptive one, seems to me to rely on question begging arguments and a straw-man account of descriptivism.
Ley, R.G. (1983). Cerebral Laterality and Imagery. In A.A. Sheikh (Ed.), Imagery: Current Theory, Research, and Application (pp.252-287). New York: Wiley. Argues for the now outdated view that imagery is primarily a right cerebral hemisphere function. For more modern accounts of cerebral laterality in relation to imagery see Michimata (1997), Farah (1995), Loverock & Modigliani (1995), Trojano & Grossi (1994), Tippett (1992), or Ehrlichman & Barrett (1983).
Liddament, T. (2000). The Myths of Imagery. Design Studies (21 #6) 589-606.
Lilley, S.A., Andrade, J., Turpin, G., Sabin-Farrell, R., & Holmes, E.A. (2009). Visuospatial Working Memory Interference with Recollections of Trauma. British Journal of Clinical Psychology (48) 309-321. For the significance of this for imagery theory, see the comment on Andrade et al. (1997).
Lobmaier, J.S. & Mast, F.W. (2008). Face Imagery Is Based on Featural Representations. Experimental Psychology (55 #1) 47-53. Evidence suggesting that (at least when it comes to images of faces) mental imagery represents the specific features of a scene better than it represents their spatial layout.
Locke, J. (1700). An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Edition of S. Pringle-Pattison (1924). Oxford: Oxford University Press. It is controversial whether (or to what extent) Locke understood the ideas, that play so large a role in his epistemology, to be mental images. See, e.g., Price (1953), Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996), Ayers (1986, 1991), White, (1990), Chappell (1994), Lowe (1995, 2005).
Lockhart, R.S. (1987). Code Dueling. Canadian Journal of Psychology (41) 387-389. Review of Paivio (1986).
Logie, R.H. & Baddeley, A.D. (1990). Imagery and Working Memory. In P.J. Hampson, D.F. Marks & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.) Imagery: Current Developments (pp. 103-128). London: Routledge.
Logie, R.H. & Denis, M. (Eds.) (1991). Mental Images in Human Cognition. Amsterdam: Elsevier Science Publishers B.V.
Lopes da Silva, F.H. (2003). Visual dreams in the congenitally blind? Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7) 328-330. Argues that the congenitally blind can have visual dreams, but see Kerr & Domhoff (2004) for a skeptical rejoinder.
Lorayne, H. (1957). How to Develop a Super Power Memory. New York: F. Fell. Instruction in the use of mnemonic techniques, particularly imagery-based ones, aimed at a popular audience. Many subsequent editions have been published.
Lormand, E. (1996). Nonphenomenal Consciousness. Noûs (30) 242-261.
Loverock, D.S. & Modigliani, V. (1995). Visual Imagery and the Brain: A Review. Journal of Mental Imagery (19) 91-132.
Lowe, E.J. (1995). Locke on Human Understanding. London: Routledge. Includes a defense of Locke's theory that our understanding of linguistic meaning is grounded in our ideas. Locke's ideas can be (but perhaps need not be) interpreted as being mental pictures. Also argues (though more tentatively than Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996) or Chappell (1994)) that the ideas of Locke should not be understood to be mental images (see also Lowe (1995)). By contrast, Ayers (1986, 1991), White (1990), and Price (1953) argue that Locke's ideas are images.
Lowe, E.J. (1996). Subjects of Experience. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Contains a sophisticated philosophical defense of the Lockean view that the meanings of linguistic utterances are rooted in imagery. Cf. Ellis (1995), Thomas (1997b).
Lowe, E.J. (2005). Locke. London: Routledge. Argues (though more tentatively than Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985, 1996) or Chappell (1994)) that the ideas of Locke should not be understood to be mental images (see also Lowe (1995)). For the opposing view see Ayers (1986, 1991), White (1990), or Price (1953).
Luria, A.R. (1960). Memory and the Structure of Mental Processes. Problems of Psychology (4) 81-94. Luria's first published account in English of his studies of the remarkable mnemonic and imagery abilities of Shereshevskii. However,the findings became well known only with the publication of Luria's (1968) book.
Luria, A.R. (1968). The Mind of a Mnemonist. (Translated from the Russian by L. Solotaroff.) New York: Basic Books. Seminal case study of a “hyper-imager”.
Luzzatti, C., Vecchi, T., Agazzi, D., Cesa-Bianchi, M., & Vergani, C. (1998). A Neurological Dissociation Between Preserved Visual and Impaired Spatial Processing in Mental Imagery. Cortex (34) 461-469.
Lycos, K. (1964). Plato and Aristotle on ‘Appearing’. Mind (73) 496-514.
Lyons, W. (1984). The Tiger and His Stripes. Analysis (44) 93-93.
Maguire, E.A., Valentine, E.R., Wilding, J.M., & Kapur, N. (2003). Routes to Remembering: The Brains behind Superior Memory. Nature Neuroscience (6) 90-95. Contemporary champion competitive memorizers do not derive their abilities from having abnormal brains, but, rather, have developed their skills in using imagery mnemonic techniques, particularly the method of loci (Yates, 1966; Ross & Lawrence, 1968).
Malcolm, N. (1970). Memory and Representation. Noûs (4) 59-70. Argues against the need for images (or, indeed, any type of representation) to explain memory.
Mangan, B. (2001) Sensation's Ghost: The Non-Sensory “Fringe” of Consciousness. Psyche (7) Available online Argues that, besides imagery, there are non-imaginal conscious contents (cf. Ellis, 1995).
Marks, D.F. (1972). Individual Differences in the Vividness of Visual Imagery and their Effects. In P. W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery (pp. 83-108). New York: Academic Press.
Marks, D.F. (1973). Visual Imagery Differences in the Recall of Pictures. British Journal of Psychology (64) 17-24. Introduces the VVIQ questionnaire, used for measuring individual differences in imagery vividness. The experimental results suggest that vivid imagers remember pictures better than other people. Although the VVIQ has been widely used since its introduction (see Marks, 1989), and has been stoutly defended by Marks in many subsequent publications (and, more tentatively, by McKelvie (1995)), the validity and meaningfulness of VVIQ scores has been quite widely questioned (Kaufmann, 1983; Chara & Verplanck, 1986; Schwitzgebel, 2002a; Dean & Morris, 2003). The VVIQ is available online.
Marks, D.F. (1983a). Mental Imagery and Consciousness: A Theoretical Review. In A.A. Sheikh (Ed.) Imagery: Current Theory, Research, and Application. New York: Wiley.
Marks, D.F. (1983b). In Defence of Imagery Questionnaires. Scandinavian Journal of Psychology (24) 243-246. A reply to Kaufmann's (1981) critique of introspectively based questionnaires on individual differences in imagery vividness, such as the VVIQ (Marks, 1973). See also: Marks (1983a, 1989, 1999), Kaufmann (1983), Chara & Verplanck (1986), McKelvie (1995), Schwitzgebel (2002a), Dean & Morris (2003).
Marks, D.F. (Ed.) (1986). Theories of Image Formation. New York: Brandon House.
Marks, D.F. (1989). Bibliography of Research Utilising the Vividness of Visual Imagery Questionnaire. Perceptual and Motor Skills (69) 707–718.
Marks, D.F. (1990). On the Relationship Between Imagery, Body and Mind. In P. Hampson, D.F. Marks & J.T.E. Richardson (eds.). Imagery: Current Developments. London: Routledge, Chapman, & Hall.
Marks, D.F. (1997). Paivio, Allan Urho. In N. Sheehy, A. J. Chapman, & W.A. Conroy (Eds.), Biographical Dictionary of Psychology (pp. 432-434). New York: Routledge.
Marks, D.F. (1999). Consciousness, Mental Imagery and Action. British Journal of Psychology (90) 567-585. Reviews work on individual differences in imagery vividness, and relates it to the psychology of action.
Marmor, G.S. (1975). Development of Kinetic Images: When Does the Child First Represent Movement in Mental Images. Cognitive Psychology (7) 548-559. The mental rotation effect demonstrated in 8- and 5-year olds (but see Platt & Cohen (1981) for a partial failure to replicate this).
Marmor, G.S. & Zaback, L.A. (1976). Mental Rotation by the Blind: Does Mental Rotation Depend on Visual Imagery? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (2) 515-521. Mental rotation effect (Shepard & Cooper, 1982) demonstrated in congenitally blind subjects using tactile stimuli (cf. Carpenter & Eisenberg, 1978; and see also Jonides, Kahn, & Rozin, 1975; Kerr, 1983; Zimler & Keenan, 1983).
Marschark, M. & Hunt, R.R. (1989) A Reexamination of the Role of Imagery in Learning and Memory. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory and Cognition (15) 710-720. A version of Dual Coding Theory, but instead of imagery and verbal representations being stored as such in long term memory (as Paivio holds), they are here seen as constructed on the fly during recall from long term memories stored in the form of a more fundamental mentalese (“propositional”) code.
Marschark, M., Richman, C.L., Yuille J.C., & Hunt R.R. (1987). The Role of Imagery in Memory: On Shared and Distinctive Information. Psychological Bulletin (102) 28-41. A version of Dual Coding Theory, but with the codes emergent from a more fundamental mentalese (“propositional”) code.
Martarelli, C.S. & Mast F.W. (2011). Preschool Children’s Eye-movements During Pictorial Recall. British Journal of Developmental Psychology (29) 425-436.
Martin, C.B. (2008). The Mind in Nature. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Martin, J.N.T. (2007). Review of: J. Lawley & P. Tompkins, Metaphors in Mind: Transformation Through Symbolic Modelling (London: Developing Company Press, 2000). Metaphor and Symbol (22 #2), 201-211.
Martin, M.G.F. (2002). The Transparency of Experience. Mind and Language (17) 376-425. Argues that to visualize something is to imagine seeing it (i.e, that the objects of sensory imaginings are experiences). For a contrary view, see Noordhof (2002).
Mast, F.W. & Kosslyn, S.M. (2002a). Visual Mental Images Can Be Ambiguous: Insights from Individual Differences in Spatial Transformation Abilities. Cognition (86) 57-70.
Mast, F.W. & Kosslyn, S.M. (2002b). Eye Movements During Visual Mental Imagery. Trends in Cognitive Sciences (6) 271-272. doi:10.1016/S1364-6613(02)01931-9
Mast, F.W., Merfeld, D.M., & Kosslyn, S.M. (2006). Visual Mental Imagery During Caloric Vestibular Stimulation. Neuropsychologia (44) 101-109. Squirting cold water in your ear will disrupt your imagery.
Matthews, G.B. (1969). Mental Copies. Philosophical Review (78) 53-73.
Mauck, B., & Dehnhardt, G. (1997). Mental Rotation in a California Sea Lion (Zalophus Californianus). Journal of Experimental Biology (200) 1309-1316.
Maylor, E.A., Reimers, S., Choi, J., Collaer, M.L., Peters, M., & Silverman, I. (2007). Gender and Sexual Orientation Differences in Cognition Across Adulthood: Age Is Kinder to Women than to Men Regardless of Sexual Orientation. Archives of Sexual Behavior (36) 235-249. Mental rotation ability (as well as several other cognitive abilities that were tested) varies not only according to sex, but sexual orientation. For mental rotation, decreasing levels of performance were found for, in order, heterosexual men, bisexual men, homosexual men, homosexual women, bisexual women, heterosexual women (some other abilities, such as category fluency and object location memory, showed the opposite pattern). For both sexes, all the tested abilities declined with adult age, but more quickly so in men.
Maxfield, L., Melnyk, W.T., & Hayman, G.C.A. (2008). A Working Memory Explanation for the Effects of Eye Movements in EMDR. Journal of EMDR Practice and Research (2) 247-261.
Mazard, A., Laou, L., Joliot, M., & Mellet, E. (2005). Neural Impact of the Semantic Content of Visual Mental Images and Visual Percepts. Cognitive Brain Research (24 #3) 423-435.
Mazard, A., Tzourio-Mazoyer, N., Crivello, F., Mazoyer, B., & Mellet, E. (2004). A PET Meta-analysis of Object and Spatial Mental Imagery. European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (16) 673-695.
McDaniel, M.A. & Pressley, M.(Eds) (1987). Imagery and Related Mnemonic Processes: Theories, Individual Differences, and Applications. New York: Springer-Verlag.
McGinn, C. (2004). Mindsight: Image, Dream, Meaning. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press. For critical reviews see Hopkins (2006), Currie & Jones (2006), and Sosa (2006), or, for a much more detailed rebuttal of McGinn's central claims and arguments, and an alternative non-deflationary account of imagination, see Thomas (2014).
McGinn, C. (2006). Images Recollected. Philosophical Books (47) 326-333. A reply to Hopkins (2006), Currie & Jones (2006), and Sosa (2006).
McKellar, P. (1957). Imagination and Thinking. London: Cohen & West.
McKelvie, S.J. (1994). The Vividness of Visual Imagery Questionnaire as a Predictor of Facial Recognition Memory. British Journal of Psychology (85 #1) 93-104. VVIQ score was not correlated with performance on the memory test for faces. However, it was also found that VVIQ score was "contaminated" by confidence, i.e., subjects who were more (falsely) confident about their memory performance also tended to score their imagery as more vivid.
McKelvie, S.J. (1995). The VVIQ as a Psychometric Test of Individual Differences in Visual Imagery Vividness: a Critical Quantitative Review and Plea for Direction [Target article with peer commentaries and reply]. Journal of Mental Imagery (19) 1-106. A detailed critical discussion of the validity of the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973). The VVIQ attempts to use introspective self-ratings to assess characteristic differences between the vividness of different people's imagery. McKelvie's ultimate assessment of the VVIQ is tentatively positive. For more vigorous defense of the VVIQ, see Marks (1983a, 1983b, 1989, 1999). For critical perspectives, see: Kaufmann (1981, 1983); Chara & Verplanck (1986); Schwitzgebel (2002a); Dean & Morris (2003); and especially Schwitzgebel (2011 ch. 3).
McKim, R.H. (1972). Experiences in Visual Thinking. Monterey, CA: Brooks/Cole. Aims to help readers improve their abilities as visual (image) thinkers.
McMahon, C.E. (1973). Images as Motives and Motivators: A Historical Perspective. American Journal of Psychology (86) 465-90.
Meador, K.J., Loring, D.W., Bowers, D., & Heilman, K.M. (1987). Remote Memory and Neglect Syndrome. Neurology (37) 522-526. Representational (imaginal) neglect can be ameliorated by turning the head leftward.
Mechelli, A., Price, C.J., Friston, K.J., & Ishai, A. (2004). Where Bottom-up Meets Top-down: Neuronal Interactions during Perception and Imagery. Cerebral Cortex (14) 1256-1265.
Meijsing, M. (2006). Being Ourselves and Knowing Ourselves: An Adverbial Account of Mental Representations. Consciousness and Cognition (15) 605-619. Although imagery is not the main focus of this paper, enough is said to make it clear that the adverbial theory of mental representation being proposed is intended to be applicable to imagery. Rabb (1975), Heil (1982), and Tye (1984) also defend an adverbial theory of imagery.
Mel, B.W. (1986). A Connectionist Learning Model for 3- Dimensional Mental Rotation, Zoom, and Pan. In Program of the Eighth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Mel, B.W. (1990). Connectionist Robot Motor Planning. San Diego, CA: Academic Press. A connectionist account of imagery, that links it to action plans.
Mellet, E., Tzourio, N., Crivello, F., Joliot, M., Denis, M., & Mazoyer, B. (1996). Functional anatomy of spatial mental imagery generated from verbal instructions. Journal of Neuroscience (16) 6504-6512. Suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain (cf. D'Esposito et al., 1997). For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Ganis, & Thompson (2001). See Kosslyn & Thompson (2003) for a review of this issue and an attempt to reconcile the conflicting findings.
Merritt, J.O. (1979). None in a Million: Results of Mass Screening for Eidetic Ability Using Objective Tests Published in Newspapers and Magazines. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (2) 612. Despite hard searching, no other individuals with anything approaching the sorts of eidetic abilities claimed for Elizabeth (Stromeyer & Psotka, 1970; Stromeyer, 1970) could be found.
Meyer, K. (2011). Primary Sensory Cortices, Top-down Projections and Conscious Experience. Progress in Neurobiology(94 #4) 408-417. Through a review of the neuroscience literature on the conditions under which activity in the visual, auditory, and somatosensory systems of the brain give rise to conscious experience, Meyer concludes that conscious perceptual experience, whether perception proper or mental imagery, arises from top-down signals from higher brain centers to early sensory cortices. Mere bottom-up activation of the early sensory cortices via the sense organs (via the thalamus) is insufficient to produce such experience. The top-down signals, associated with consciousness, represent active, interpretative processes working on the bottom-up products of perceptual input (if any) (cf. Thomas, 1999b).
Michelon, P. & Koenig, O. (2002). On the Relationship Between Visual Imagery and Visual Perception: Evidence from Priming Studies. European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (14) 161-184.
Michimata, C. (1997). Hemispheric Processing of Categorical and Coordinate Spatial Relations in Vision and Visual Imagery. Brain and Cognition (33) 370-387.
Miller, A.I. (1984). Imagery in Scientific Thought: Creating 20th Century Physics. Boston MA: Birkhäuser. Argues for an essential role for imagery in modern physical thought (and scientific thought in general).
Miller, E. (1931). The Eidetic Image—An Undertone of Psychosis. Introduction to a Future Inquiry. Proceedings of the Royal Society of Medicine (24 #9) 1223-1230. Reprint available online Under the influence of the once widespread view that imagery in general, and eidetic imagery in particular is characteristic of "primitive" thought processes (those typical of children and/or "savages"), Miller suggests that eidetic imagery may be related to psychotic hallucination. (I very much doubt that this is a view widely shared by psychiatrists today.)
Miller, G.A., Galanter, E., & Pribram, K.H. (1960). Plans and the Structure of Behavior. New York: Holt, Rinehart & Winston. Most of the uses of the word “image” in this seminal early work of cognitive psychology, seem to refer to something rather different from mental imagery as that expression is now usually understood. However it does also contain a brief discussion of an imagery-based mnemonic, as studied in the unpublished experiments of Wallace, Turner, & Perkins (see Hoffman & Senter, 1978), that is of some historical significance in the field.
Milton, J., Small, S.L., & Solodkin, A. (2008). Imaging Motor Imagery: Methodological Issues Related to Expertise. Methods (45) 336-341. Issues in the use of brain imaging techniques to study motor imagery and its use in sport.
Minsky, M. (1986). The Society of Mind. New York: Simon & Schuster.
Mitchell, D.B. & Richman, C.L. (1980). Confirmed Reservations: Mental Travel. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (6) 58-66.
Mitchison, G. (1996) Where Is the Mind's Eye? Current Biology (6) 508-510. Endorses Kosslyn's theory that imagery is quasi-pictorial, and is embodied as activation in primary visual cortex (V1), on the basis of the findings of Kosslyn, Thompson, Kim, & Alpert (1995).
Miyashita, Y. (1995). How the Brain Creates Imagery: Projection to Primary Visual Cortex. Science (268) 1719-1720.
Modrak, D.K.W. (1986). Phantasia Reconsidered. Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie (68) 47-69.
Modrak, D.K.W. (1987). Aristotle: The Power of Perception. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Modrak, D.K.W. (2001). Aristotle's Theory of Language and Meaning. New York: Cambridge University Press. Imagination (phantasia) and imagery (phantasmata) played large roles in Aristotle's theory.
Moran, T.P. (1973). The Symbolic Imagery Hypothesis: A Production System Model. Ph.D. thesis. Carnegie-Mellon University, Pittsburgh, PA. (University Microfilms 74-14,657.)
Morgan, M. J. (1979). The Two Spaces. In N. Bolton (Ed.), Philosophical Problems in Psychology (pp. 66-88). London: Methuen. Argues that the space of mental imagery is not a separate mental space, but the ordinary space in which we live and act.
Moro, V., Berlucchi, G., Lerch, J., Tomaiuolo, F., & Aglioti, S.M. (2008). Selective Deficit of Mental Visual Imagery with Intact Primary Visual Cortex and Visual Perception. Cortex (44) 109-118. Case study of a patient with a visual imagery deficit due to brain injury, but with relatively intact memory and perception. See also: Brain (1954); Basso et al. (1980); Botez et al. (1985); Goldenberg (1992); Young & van de Wal (1996); Riddoch (1990); Zeman et al. (2010).
Morris, P.E. & Hampson, P.J. (1983). Imagery and Consciousness. London: Academic Press. One of very few modern scientific works to directly and explicitly confront the issue of the conscious nature of mental imagery (Baars, 1996b; Thomas, 2009). (Amongst the handful of other primarily scientific works that also confront the issue are: Richardson (1980 ch. 2); Kosslyn (1992, 2001); Thomas (1999b, 2009); and the essays in Baars (1996a). Some more purely philosophical works (e.g., Place, 1956) also directly confront it, but even they are not abundant.) This book also usefully summarizes much experimental evidence, and covers quasi-pictorial, description, and enactive theories (which it, rather unperspicuously calls "role playing models"), and attempts a theoretical synthesis.
Morris, T., Spittle, M., & Watt, A.P. (2005). Imagery In Sport. Champaign, IL: Human Kinetics. Monograph (seemingly the first) on the use and effectiveness of imagery techniques in sports psychology, to increase athletic performance.
Morrison, A.P., Beck, A.T., Glentworth, D., Dunn, H., Reid, G.S., Larkin, W., & Williams, S. (2002). Imagery and Psychotic Symptoms: A Preliminary Investigation. Behaviour Research and Therapy (40 #9) 1053-1062.
Mortensen, C. (1989). Mental Images: Should Cognitive Science Learn from Neurophysiology? In P. Slezak & W.R. Albury (Eds.), Computers, Brains and Minds (pp. 123-136). Dordrecht, Netherlands: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
Moskowitz, E. & Berger, R. (1969). Rapid Eye Movements and Dream Imagery: Are They Related? Nature (224) 613-614. This article is inclined to answer its title question in the negative, but more recent work (Herman et al., 1984; Hong et al., 1997, 2009; Sprenger et al., 2010; Leclair-Visonneau et al., 2010) indicates a positive answer.
Moulton, S.T. & Kosslyn, S.M. (2009). Imagining Predictions: Mental Imagery as Mental Emulation. Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society of London B (364) 1273–1280. The function of imagery in planning for future actions and eventualities.
Mowrer, O.H. (1960a). Learning Theory and the Symbolic Processes. New York: Wiley. An attempt to introduce imagery into Behaviorist theory.
Mowrer, O.H. (1960b). Learning Theory and Behavior. New York: Wiley. An attempt to introduce imagery into Behaviorist theory.
Mowrer, O.H. (1977). Mental Imagery: An Indispensible Psychological Concept. Journal of Mental Imagery (2) 303-321. Theoretical and historical reflections.
Moyer, R.S. & Dumais S.T. (1978). Mental Comparison. In G.H. Bower (Ed.), The Psychology of Learning and Motivation, Volume 12. New York: Academic Press.
Munroe, K J., Giacobbi, P.R.jr., Hall, C.R., & Weinberg, R. (2000). The Four W's of Imagery Use: Where, When, Why, and What. The Sport Psychologist (14) 119-137.
Murphy, S.M. (1994). Imagery Interventions in Sport. Medicine and Science in Sports and Exercise (26) 486-494.
Nadaner, D. (1988). Visual Imagery, Imagination, and Education. In K. Egan & D. Nadaner (Eds.), Imagination and Education. Milton Keynes, U.K.: Open University Press.
Nanay, B. (2010). Perception and Imagination: Amodal Perception as Mental Imagery. Philosophical Studies (150 #2) 239-254. See Briscoe (2011) for a critical response.
Narayanan, N.H. (1993). Imagery: Computational and Cognitive Perspectives. Computational Intelligence (9) 303-308.
Neisser, U. (1967). Cognitive Psychology. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall. The first textbook of the new Cognitive approach to psychology, which did much to set the new field's tone and direction. Its sections on imagery remain valuable.
Neisser, U. (1970). Visual Imagery as Process and as Experience. In J.S. Antrobus (Ed.), Cognition and Affect. Boston, MA: Little, Brown & Co.
Neisser, U. (1972a). Changing Conceptions of Imagery. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery. London: Academic Press.
Neisser, U. (1972b). A Paradigm Shift in Psychology. Science (176) 628-30. A major player in the cognitive revolution places the revival of imagery research at its heart.
Neisser, U. (1976). Cognition and Reality. San Francisco, CA: W.H. Freeman. Proposes one of the most fully developed versions of the enactive theory of imagery: an alternative to both pictorial/analog and propositional/descriptional accounts.
Neisser, U. (1978a). Anticipations, Images and Introspection. Cognition (6) 167-174. Defends the theory of Neisser (1976) from the critique of Hampson & Morris (1978).
Neisser, U. (1978b). Perceiving, Anticipating and Imagining. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science (9) 89-106. Summary version of the theory of Neisser (1976).
Neisser, U. (1979). Images, Models, and Human Nature. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (2) 561. A critical commentary on Kosslyn, Pinker, Smith and Schwartz (1979), rejecting their quasi-pictorial theory of imagery and their computational methodology.
Neisser, U. (Ed.) (1982). Memory Observed: Remembering in Natural Contexts. San Francisco: Freeman.
Neisser, U. & Kerr, N. (1973). Spatial and Mnemonic Properties of Visual Images. Cognitive Psychology (5) 138-150. Evidence that imagery retains its mnemonic powers even when the objects to be remembered are imagined as concealed. It is claimed that this shows that mnemonically effective imagery is more spatial than visual, and that this supports Neisser's (1976) enactive theory of imagery. See Keenan & Moore (1979; Keenan, 1983) for a critique of this work, and Kerr & Neisser (1983) for a defense.
Nekovarova, T., Nedvidek, J., Klement, D., Rokyta, R., & Bures, J. (2013). Mental Transformations of Spatial Stimuli in Humans and in Monkeys: Rotation vs. Translocation. Behavioural Brain Research (240 #1) 182-191.
Newell, A. (1972). A Theoretical Exploration of Mechanisms for Coding the Stimulus. In A.W. Melton & E. Martin (Eds.), Coding Processes in Human Memory (pp. 373-434). Washington D.C.: Winston.
Newton, N. (1982). Experience and Imagery. The Southern Journal of Philosophy (21) 475-487. Argues the importance of non-visual modes of imagery in human experience.
Newton, N. (1989). Visualizing is Imagining Seeing: a reply to White. Analysis (49) 77-81.
Newton, N. (1993). The Sensorimotor Theory of Cognition. Pragmatics and Cognition (1) 267-305.
Newton, N. (1996). Foundations of Understanding. Amsterdam: John Benjamins. A sensorimotor theory of intentionality, imagery, and cognition.
Nicholas, J.M. (Ed.) (1977). Images, Perception and Knowledge, (Western Ontario Studies in the Philosophy of Science, #8). Dordrecht/Boston: Reidel.
Nichols, S., Stich, S., Leslie, A., & Klein, D. (1996). Varieties of Off-Line Simulation. In P. Carruthers & P.K. Smith (Eds.), Theories of Theories of Mind. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. Preprint available online Section 3.3 is a critique of Currie's (1995) simulation account of imagery: Currie's proposal, it is argued, seems to be consistent with, and to add nothing to, other established, and more detailed, theories such as quasi-pictorialism and description theory. (Currie & Abell (1999) accept this criticism, and attempt to develop a more substantive account of simulationism that rejects quasi-pictorialism.)
Noordhof, P., (2002). Imagining Objects and Imagining Experiences. Mind and Language (17) 426-455.
Nordin, S.M., Cumming, J., Vincent, J., & McGrory, S. (2006). Mental Practice or Spontaneous Play? Examining Which Types of Imagery Constitute Deliberate Practice in Sport. Journal of Applied Sport Psychology (18 #4) 345-362. Mental practice is a technique, now widely used in competitive sport and athletics (particularly at more elite levels), whereby physical skills can supposedly be enhanced through practicing them solely in the imagination. For more on this topic (and other uses of imagery in sport and athletics) see Richardson (1967), Ryan & Simons (1982), Feltz & Landers (1983), Paivio (1985), Sheikh & Korn (1994), Driskell et al. (1994), Morris et al. (2005), Short et al. (2006), Weinberg (2008). For a more skeptical perspective, see Budney et al. (1994).
Nussbaum, M.C. (1978). The Role of Phantasia in Aristotle's Explanation of Action. In her Aristotle's De Motu Animalium: Text with Translation, Commentary, and Interpretative Essays. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
Nyíri, J.C. (2001). The Picture theory of Reason. In B. Brogaard & B. Smith (Eds.), Rationality and Irrationality (Schriftenreihe-Wittgenstein Gesellschaft, Vol. 29). Vienna: Öbv&hpt. Nyíri 2001 preprint available online A contemporary philosophical defence of imagery theories of thought and meaning, and a retrospect on their 20th century eclipse.
O'Boyle, Michael.W., Cunnington, R., Silk T.J., Vaughan, D., Jackson, G., Syngeniotis, A., & Egan, G.F. (2005). Mathematically Gifted Male Adolescents Activate a Unique Brain Network During Mental Rotation. Cognitive Brain Research (25) 583-587.
O'Connor, K.P. & Aardema, F. (2005). The Imagination: Cognitive, Pre-cognitive, and Meta-cognitive Aspects. Consciousness and Cognition (14) 233-256.
O'Craven, K.M. & Kanwisher, N. (2000). Mental Imagery of Faces and Places Activates Corresponding Stimulus Specific Brain Regions. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (12) 1013-1023.
Ogden, J.A. (1985). Contralesional Neglect of Constructed Visual Images in Right and Left Brain-Damaged Patients. Neuropsychologia (23) 273-277.
O'Regan, J. K., & Noë, A. (2001). A Sensorimotor Account of Vision and Visual Consciousness. Behavoral and Brain Sciences (24) 939-973. Reprint available online
Örnkloo, H. & von Hofsten, C. (2007). Fitting Objects Into Holes: On the Development of Spatial Cognition Skills. Developmental Psychology (43 #2) 404-416. Mental rotation skill studied in infants. It appears to develop, on average, at about 22 months of age.
Ortigue, S., Viaud-Delmon, I., Michel, C.M., Blanke, O., Annoni, J.M., Pegna, A., Mayer, E., Spinelli, L., & Landis, T. (2003). Pure Imagery Hemi-Neglect of Far Space. Neurology (60) 2000–2002. A case study of a neurological patient who does not have symptoms of perceptual hemi-neglect, or of representational neglect for things imagined as being within reach, but does show signs of representational left hemi-neglect for things imagined further away.
Oyama, T. & Ichikawa, S. (1990). Some Experimental Studies on Imagery in Japan. Journal of Mental Imagery (14) 185-196.
Owen, A.M., Coleman, M.R., Boly, M., Davis, M.H., Laureys, S., & Pickard, J.D. (2006). Detecting Awareness in the Vegetative State. Science (313) 1402. fMRI evidence suggesting that mental imagery can be experienced even by a brain injured patient in a coma (vegetative state). The patient was verbally instructed to imagine performing certain activities, and the fMRI data following the instructions was similar to that seen in conscious subjects following similar instructions. Thus these results also imply that at least some coma patients may be able to hear and understand what is said to them. (This is a study of a single patient, however, so the results may not generalize.)
Paine, P.A. (1980). Eidetic Imagery and Recall Accuracy in Preschool Children. Journal of Psychology: Interdisciplinary and Applied (105 #2) 253-258.
Paivio, A. (1963). Learning of Adjective-Noun Paired Associates as a Function of Adjective-Noun Word Order and Noun Abstractness. Canadian Journal of Psychology (17) 370-379.
Paivio, A. (1965). Abstractness, Imagery and Meaningfulness in Paired Associate Learning. Journal of Verbal Learning and Verbal Behavior (4) 32-38.
Paivio, A. (1971). Imagery and Verbal Processes. New York: Holt, Rinehart and Winston. (Republished in 1979 – Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.) Classic statement of the Dual Coding (imaginal and linguistic) theory of memory and mental representation, with much empirical evidence on the mnemonic effects of imagery. Paivio's work (together with Shepard's mental rotation experiments) probably played the key role in re-establishing imagery as a scientifically wothwhile topic of investigation in cognitive science, aftre the era of Behaviorist neglect of the phenomenon.
Paivio, A. (1975a). Imagery and Synchronic Thinking. Canadian Psychological Review (16) 147-163.
Paivio, A. (1975b) Perceptual Comparisons Through the Mind's Eye. Memory and Cognition (3) 635-647. Experimental support for Dual Coding Theory from the symbolic distance effect. (Cf. Paivio, 1978a, 1978b).
Paivio, A. (1975c). Neomentalism. Canadian Journal of Psychology (29) 263-291.
Paivio, A. (1977). Images, Propositions and Knowledge. In J.M. Nicholas (Ed.), Images, Perception and Knowledge. Dordrecht/Boston, MA: Reidel.
Paivio, A. (1978a). Comparisons of Mental Clocks. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (4) 61-71. Experimental support for Dual Coding Theory from the symbolic distance effect. (Cf. Paivio, 1975b. 1978b).
Paivio, (1978b), Mental Comparisons Involving Abstract Attributes. Memory and Cognition (6) 199-208. Experimental support for Dual Coding Theory from the symbolic distance effect. (Cf. Paivio, 1975b. 1978a).
Paivio, A. (1979). Psychological processes in the Comprehension of Metaphor. In A. Ortony (Ed.), Metaphor and Thought (pp. 150-171). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Paivio, A. (1982). Individual Differences in Coding Processes. In F. Klix, J. Hoffman, & E. van der Meer (eds.), Cognitive Research in Psychology: Recent Approaches, Designs, and Results. East Berlin: VEB Deutscher Verlag der Wissenschaften DDR. Reprinted in Paivio (1991b).
Paivio, A. (1983a). The Empirical Case for Dual Coding. In J.C. Yuille (Ed.), Imagery, Memory and Cognition: Essays in Honour of Allan Paivio. Hillsdale NJ: Erlbaum.
Paivio, A. (1983b). The Mind's Eye in Arts and Science. Poetics (12) 1-18.
Paivio, A. (1985). Cognitive and Motivational Functions of Imagery in Human Performance. Canadian Journal of Applied Sport Sciences (10) 22-28.
Paivio, A. (1986). Mental Representations: A Dual Coding Approach. New York: Oxford University Press. A major restatement and defense of Dual Coding Theory.
Paivio, A. (1991a). Dual Coding Theory: Retrospect and Current Status. Canadian Journal of Psychology (45) 255-287.
Paivio, A. (1991b). Images in Mind: The Evolution of a Theory. Hemel Hempstead, UK: Harvester Wheatsheaf. Mostly consists of reprints of previously published material, but with a couple of new chapters.
Paivio, A. (1991c). Conceptual Pegs in Theory Development. In his Images in Mind: The Evolution of a Theory (pp. 1-18). Hemel Hempstead, UK: Harvester Wheatsheaf. Gives an autobiographical account of how Paivio first became interested in the role of imagery in memory, and the development of his Dual Coding theory.
Paivio, A. (1995). Imagery and Memory. In M.S. Gazzaniga (Ed.) The Cognitive Neurosciences. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. (pp. 977-986.)
Paivio, A. (2007). Mind and Its Evolution: A Dual Coding Theoretical Approach. Mahwah, NJ: Erlbaum.
Paivio, A. & Begg I. (1981). Psychology of Language. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
Paivio, A. & Desrochers, A. (1980). A Dual Coding Approach to Bilingual Memory. Canadian Journal of Psychology (34) 390-401.
Paivio, A. & Harshman, R. (1983). Factor Analysis of a Questionnaire on Imagery and Verbal Habits and Skills. Canadian Journal of Psychology (37) 461-483.
Paivio, A., Yuille, J.C., & Madigan, S. (1968). Concreteness, Imagery and Meaningfulness Values for 925 Nouns. Journal of Experimental Psychology Monographs (78 – #1, part 2).
Palmer, S.E. (1975a). Visual Perception and World Knowledge: Notes on a Model of Sensory-Cognitive Interaction. In D.A. Norman, D.E. Rumelhart et al. (Eds.), Explorations in Cognition. San Francisco: W.H. Freeman.
Palmer, S.E. (1975b). The Nature of Perceptual Representation: An Examination of the Analog/propositional Controversy. In R. Schank & B.L. Webber (Eds.), Theoretical Issues in Natural Language Processing (pp. 165-172). Cambridge, MA: TINLAP.
Palmer, S.E. (1977). Hierarchical Structure in Perceptual Representation. Cognitive Psychology (9) 441-474.
Palmer, S.E. (1978). Fundamental Aspects of Cognitive Representation. In E. Rosch & B.B. Lloyd (Eds.), Cognition and Categorization. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. Argues that the analog/propositional debate over imagery misses the point about the nature of representation in computational theories of mind.
Park, S. & Kosslyn, S.M. (1990). Imagination. In M.G. Johnson & T.B. Henley (Eds.), Reflections on the Principals of Psychology: William James After a Century (pp. 183-196). Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Pear, T.H. (1924). Imagery and Mentality. British Journal of Psychology (14) 291-299.
Pear, T.H. (1927). The Relevance of Visual Imagery to the Process of Thinking 1. British Journal of Psychology (18) 1-14. A companion piece to Bartlett (1927) and Aveling (1927).
Pearson, D.G., Deeprose, C., Wallace-Hadrill, S., Heyes, S.B., & Holmes, E.A. (2013). Assessing Mental Imagery in Clinical Psychology: A Review of Imagery Measures and a Guiding Framework. Clinical Psychology Review (33 #1) 1-23. Available online
Pearson, J., Clifford, C.W.G. & Tong, F. (2008). The Functional Impact of Mental Imagery on Conscious Perception. Current Biology (18) 982-986.
Pearson, J., Rademaker, R.L., & Tong, F. (2011). Evaluating the Mind’s Eye: The Metacognition of Visual Imagery. Psychological Science (22 #12), 1535-1542.Evidence that people’s subjective estimates of the vividness of their imagery can be quite reliable.
Pelizzon, L., Brandimonte, M.A., & Favretto, A. (1999). Imagery and Recognition: Dissociable Measures of Memory? European Journal of Cognitive Psychology (11) 429-443.
Penfield, W. (1958). Some Mechanisms of Consciousness Discovered During Electrical Stimulation of the Brain. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences (44) 51-66.
Perkins, M. (1970). The Picturing in Seeing. Journal of Philosophy (67) 321-339.
Perky, C.W. (1910) An Experimental Study of Imagination. American Journal of Psychology (21) 422-52. A famous study that is usually interpreted as showing that visual mental images are not subjectively distinguishable from percepts of very weak visual stimuli. See Segal (1971, 1972) for a modern attempt at replication, and Craver-Lemley & Reeves (1992; Craver-Lemley & Arterberry, 2001) for both corroboration of the effect and an alternative interpretation of its significance.
Perner, J., Kloo, D., & Rohwer, M. (2010). Retro- and Prospection for Mental Time Travel: Emergence of Episodic Remembering and Mental Rotation in 5- to 8-year Old Children. Consciousness and Cognition (19 #3) 802-815.
Peterson, M.A. (1993). The Ambiguity of Mental Images: Insights Regarding the Structure of Shape Memory and Its Function in Creativity. Advances in Psychology (98) 151-185.
Peterson, M.A., Kihlstrom, J.F., Rose, P.M., & Glisky, M.L. (1992). Mental Images Can be Ambiguous: Reconstruals and Reference Frame Reversals. Memory and Cognition (20), 107-123. See the comment on Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Petre, M. & Blackwell, A.F. (1999). Mental Imagery in Program Design and Visual Programming. International Journal of Human-Computer Studies (51) 7-30. Preprint available online A study of the (apparently quite significant) role played by imagery in the thought processes of computer programming.
Pham, M.T., Meyvis, T., & Zhou, R. (2001). Beyond the Obvious: Chronic Vividness of Imagery and the Use of Information in Decision Making. Organizational Behavior and Human Decision Processes (84 #2) 226-253.
Philippe, M.-D. (1971). Phantasia in the Philosophy of Aristotle. The Thomist (35) 1-42.
Piaget, J. & Inhelder, B. (1971). Mental Imagery in the Child. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. (Originally published in French as L'Image Mentale chez L'Enfant. Presses Universitaires de France, 1966.)
Pinker, S. (1980). Mental Imagery and the Third Dimension. Journal of Experimental Psychology: General (109) 354-71.
Pinker, S. (1988). A Computational Theory of the Mental Imagery Medium. In M. Denis, J. Engelkamp, & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.), Cognitive and Neuropsychological Approaches to Mental Imagery. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Martinus Nijhoff. A three-dimensional version of the picture (or array) theory.
Pinker, S., Choate, P.A., & Finke, R.A. (1984). Mental Extrapolation in Patterns Constructed from Memory. Memory and Cognition (12) 207-218.
Pinker, S. & Finke, R.A. (1980) Emergent Two-Dimensional Patterns in Images Rotated in Depth. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (6) 244-264.
Pinker, S. & Kosslyn, S.M. (1978). The Representation and Manipulation of Three-Dimensional Space in Mental Images. Journal of Mental Imagery (2) 69-84.
Pitcher, G. (1977). Berkeley. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. In chapter 11 Pitcher argues that Berkeley flirts with an adverbial theory of the nature of ideas in a few passages, but he makes it clear that Berkeley is not consistent in this, and elsewhere (notably in chapter 5) Pitcher roundly endorses the standard view that Berkeley conceives of ideas as mental images.
Pitt, D. (2004). The Phenomenology of Cognition; or, What Is It Like to Think That P? Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (69) 1-36. Reprint available online
Place, U.T. (1956). Is Consciousness a Brain Process? British Journal of Psychology (47) 44-50. Imagery is one of Place's key examples of conscious experiences that, he argues, are best understood as contingently identical to brain processes. Despite this article's fame, and its seminal status in 20th century philosophy of mind, Place's specific views on mental imagery have received little attention. He always insisted, both here and in later work, that imagery (like other conscious experiences) was to be identified with brain processes rather than brain states.
Platt, J.E. & Cohen, S. (1981). Mental Rotation Task Performance as a Function of Age and Training. Journal of Psychology (108) 173-178. A (partial) non-replication of Marmor’s (1975) findings on mental rotation in young children.
Podgorny, P. & Shepard, R.N. (1978). Functional Representations Common to Visual Perception and Imagination. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (4) 21-35.
Ponzio, C.J. (2013). Reading (for) Magical Gaps: The Novice Reader's Aesthetic Response to Magical Realism. Unpublished M.A. thesis, World Cultures Graduate Group, University of California, Merced. Available online
Postle, B.R., Idzikowski, C., Della Sala, S., Logie, R.H., & Baddeley, A.D. (2006). The Selective Disruption of Spatial Working Memory by Eye Movements. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (59) 100-120. Deliberately moving the eyes whilst maintaining a visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness and emotional impact of the image. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there.
Prather, S.C. & Sathian, K. (2002). Mental Rotation of Tactile Stimuli. Cognitive Brain Research (14) 91-98.
Predebon, J. & Wenderoth, P. (1985). Imagined Stimuli: Imaginary Effects? Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (23) 215-216.
Pressey, A.W. & Wilson, A.E. (1974). The Poggendorff Illusion in Imagination. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (3) 447-449. A visual illusion induced by imagery. This result may not be so easily explained away as the effect of experimental demand characteristics as are the similar findings of Wallace (1980, 1984) and Berbaum & Chung (1981).
Pressley, G.M. (1976). Mental Imagery Helps Eight-year-olds Remember What They Read. Journal of Educational Psychology (68 #3) 355-359.
Price, H.H. (1953). Thinking and Experience. London: Hutchinson. Contains a defense of an imagery based account of thinking and meaning.
Prime, D.J. & Jolicoeur, P. (2010). Mental Rotation Requires Visual Short-term Memory: Evidence from Human Electric Cortical Activity. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (22 #11) 2437-2446.
Prinz, J.J. (2002). Furnishing the Mind: Concepts and their Perceptual Basis. Boston, MA: MIT Press. Defends an empricist theory of concepts, closely akin to the traditional image theory of ideas, but updated in the light of cognitive science. Strongly influenced by the work of Barsalou (1999).
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1973). What the Mind's Eye Tells the Mind's Brain: A Critique of Mental Imagery. Psychological Bulletin (80) 1-25. A seminal attack on pictorial accounts of imagery. This was the opening salvo of the infamous analog/propositional dispute.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1978). Imagery and Artificial Intelligence. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science (9) 19-55. Pylyshyn argues that images are best conceived of as propositional descriptions within a general computational account of mental representation.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1979a). The Rate of ‘Mental Rotation’ of Images: a Test of a Holistic Analogue Hypothesis. Memory and Cognition (7) 19-28.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1979b). Validating Computational Models: A Critique of Anderson's Indeterminacy of Representation Claim. Psychological Review (86) 383-394. A commentary on Anderson (1978). See also Palmer (1978), Hayes-Roth (1979), and Anderson (1979).
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1981). The Imagery Debate: Analogue Media Versus Tacit Knowledge. Psychological Review (88) 16-45. A restatement of the propositional/descriptional account of imagery that squarely confronts the empirical arguments brought by pictorialists.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (1984). Computation and Cognition: Toward a Foundation for Cognitive Science. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2001). Is the imagery debate over? If so, what was it about? In E. Dupoux (Ed.), Language, Brain, and Cognitive Development: Essays in Honor of Jacques Mehler. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Preprint available online (pdf)
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2002a). Mental Imagery: In search of a theory. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 157-182 (-237 including commentaries and reply). Reprint available online A major restatement and updating of Pylyshyn's conceptual and empirical objections to pictorial theories of imagery, including a critique of recent claims (e.g. Kosslyn, 1994; Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al., 1999) that neuroscientific evidence suports pictorialism.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2002b). Stalking the elusive mental image screen (reply to commentaries). Behavioral and Brain Sciences. (25) 216-237. The reply to the invited commentaries on Pylyshyn (2002a). Expands usefully on what Pylyshyn sees as wrong with the neuroscience based arguments for pictorialism.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2003a). Return of the Mental Image: Are There Really Pictures in the Brain? Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7) 113-118. Reprint available online Essentially a précis of Pylyshyn (2002 a & b), but with some additional examples.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2003b). Seeing and Visualizing: It's Not What You Think. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Preprint available online
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2003 c). Explaining Mental Imagery: Now You See It, Now You Don’t (Reply to Kosslyn et al.). Trends in Cognitive Sciences (7, #3) 111-112.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2004). Mental Imagery. In R.L. Gregory (ed.), The Oxford Companion to the Mind (2nd ed.) Oxford: Oxford University Press. Preprint available online Succinctly restates Pylyshyn's major criticisms of pictorial theories of imagery.
Pylyshyn, Z.W. (2007). Things and Places: How the Mind Connects with the World. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Although the work is not primarily concerned with imagery, in fact it restates and extends some of Pylyshyn’s objections to pictorial theories, and, in §4.5, he discusses the phenomenal experience of imagery (although mainly with a view to arguing that it is a poor guide to theory).
Quaiser-Pohl, C., Geiser, C., & Lehmann, W. (2006). The Relationship Between Computer-game Preference, Gender, and Mental-rotation Ability. Personality and Individual Differences (40) 609-619.
Rabb, J.D. (1975). Imaging: An Adverbial Analysis. Dialogue (14) 312-318. An adverbial theory of imagery. Cf. Heil (1982), Tye (1984), Meijsing (2006).
Ramachandran, V. S. & Hirstein, W. (1997). Three Laws of Qualia: What Neurology Tells Us about the Biological Functions of Consciousness. Journal of Consciousness Studies (4) 429-457.
Recarte, M.A., & Nunes, L.M. (2000). Effects of Verbal and Spatial-Imagery Tasks on Eye Fixations While Driving. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Applied (6 #1) 31-43.
Reddy, L., Tsuchiya, N., & Serre, T. (2010). Reading the Mind's Eye: Decoding Category Information During Mental Imagery. NeuroImage (50 #2) 818-825. Using fMRI the experimenters were able to decode which out of four categories of object type subjects were imagining. The crucial, category specific activation was in ventral-temporal cortex.
Reed, S.K. (1974). Structural Descriptions and The Limitations of Visual Imagery. Memory and Cognition (2) 329-336.
Reed, S.K., Hock, H.S., & Lockhead, G.R. (1983). Tacit Knowledge and the Effect of Pattern Configuration on Mental Scanning. Memory and Cognition (11) 137-143.
Rees, D.A. (1971). Aristotle's Treatment of Phantasia. In J.P. Anton & G.L. Kustas (Eds.) Essays in Ancient Greek Philosophy (pp. 491-504). Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
Reid, T. (1764). An Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense. (Edition of D. Brookes. University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press, 1997.) Interprets the ideas of his philosophical predecessors as mental images, and rejects the concept of idea partly on that basis.
Reid, T. (1785). Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man. (Edition of D. Brookes. University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press, 2002.) Interprets Locke (and other philosophers who rely on a concept of idea) as holding that ideas are images, and rejects the concept of idea partly on that basis.
Reisberg, D. (Ed.) (1992). Auditory Imagery. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Reisberg, D. (1994). Equipotential Recipes for Unambiguous Images: A Reply to Rollins. Philosophical Psychology (7) 359-366. See Rollins (1994) and the annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Reisberg, D. & Chambers, D. (1991). Neither Pictures Nor Propositions: What Can We Learn From a Mental Image? Canadian Journal of Psychology (45) 336-352. See annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Reisberg, D., Culver, L.C., Heuer, F., & Fischman, D. (1986). Visual Memory: When Imagery Vividness Makes a Difference. Journal of Mental Imagery (10) 51-74. Individual differences study using the VVIQ questionnaire of Marks (1973). Vivid imagers show worse color memory than less vivid imagers. A companion piece to Heuer, Fischman, & Reisberg (1986).
Reisberg, D. & Morris, A. (1985). Images Contain What the Imager Put There: A Nonreplication of Illusions in Imagery. Bulletin of the Psychonomic Society (23) 493-496. A rebuttal to Wallace (1984). Also see Predebon & Wenderoth (1985).
Reisberg, D., Pearson, D.G., & Kosslyn, S.M. (2003). Intuitions And Introspections About Imagery: The Role Of Imagery Experience In Shaping An Investigator's Theoretical Views. Applied Cognitive Psychology (17) 147-160 People's initial theoretical intuitions about the nature of imagery correlate with how vivid they take their own imagery to be. (Vividness assessed by the VVIQ questionnaire (Marks, 1973)).
Reisberg, D., Smith, J.D., Baxter, D.A., & Sonenshine, M. (1989). “Enacted” Auditory Images are Ambiguous; “Pure” Auditory Images are Not. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (41A) 619-641. An auditory analogue of the effect discovered by Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Reisberg, D., Wilson, M., & Smith, J.D. (1991). Auditory Imagery and Inner Speech. In R.H. Logie & M. Denis (Eds.), Mental Images in Human Cognition. Amsterdam: Elsevier Science Publishers B.V. (pp. 59-81).
Rey, G. (1981). Introduction: What are Mental Images? In N. Block (Ed.) Readings in the Philosophy of Psychology, Vol. 2. London: Methuen.
Reynolds, J.W. (1860). Historic and Mental Imagery. London: Wertheim, Macintosh, and Hunt. Available online This is primarily a Christian religious tract, but is of interest for students of the history of the uses of imagery. It advocates the formation of mental images of historical or Biblical events whilst reading about them, as a means to "the increase of mental power, and the correcting, beautifying, and enlarging of the imagination."
Rhem, L.P. (1973). Relationships Among Measures of Visual Imagery. Behavior Research and Therapy (11) 265-270.
Rhodes, G. & O'Leary, A. (1985) Imagery Effects on Early Visual Processing. Perception and Psychophysics (37) 382-388.
Ribot, T. (1890). Psychologie de L'Attention. Paris: Alcan. (Translated as: The Psychology of Attention. Chicago: Open Court, 1903.) English translation available online Sketches a theory of imagery in terms of the control of attention.
Ribot, T. (1900). Essai sur L'Imagination Créatrice. Paris: Alcan. (Translated as: Essay on the Creative Imagination. Chicago: Open Court, 1906.) Includes an attentional theory of imagery, broadly akin to the motor theories of Dunlap (1914) and Washburn (1916).
Ricard, M. (2006). Buddhist Perspectives on Mental Imagery. In A. Harrington & A. Zajonc (Eds.) The Dalai Lama at MIT (pp. 69-78). Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Richards, N. (1977). Depicting and Visualising. Mind (82) 218-229.
Richardson, A. (1967). Mental Practice: A Review and Discussion. Research Quarterly (38) 95-107 & 263-273. Mental practice is a technique, now widely used in competitive sport and athletics, whereby physical skills can supposedly be enhanced through practicing them solely in the imagination. Since this review article was published the technique has engendered much further research, and has increasingly come actually to be used by athletes in their training (particularly at more elite levels). For more recent research on the topic (and other uses of imagery in sport and athletics) see Ryan & Simons (1982), Feltz & Landers (1983), Paivio (1985), Driskell et al. (1994), Sheikh & Korn (1994), Morris et al. (2005), Short et al. (2006), Weinberg (2008). For a skeptical perspective, see Budney et al. (1994).
Richardson, A. (1969). Mental Imagery. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul. Despite its age, this remains a useful literature review, especially because it covers not only mental imagery in the narrower sense in which the term is usually used today (what Richardson calls “memory imagery”), but also other more or less distantly related quasi-perceptual phenomena such as eidetic imagery, hypnagogic imagery, hallucinations, and after-images.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1975). Concreteness and Imagability. Quarterly Journal of Experimental Psychology (27) 235-249.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1980). Mental Imagery and Human Memory. London: Macmillan. Although the book is mainly concerned with empirical issues, chapter two is a Wittgenstein influenced philosophical discussion of the concept of imagery.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1994). Gender Differences in Mental Rotation. Perceptual and Motor Skills (78) 435-488.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1995). The Efficacy of Imagery Mnemonics in Memory Remediation. Neuropsychologia (33) 1345-1357.
Richardson, J.T.E. (1999). Imagery. Psychology Press: Hove, U.K. Useful textbook concisely surveying the cognitive psychology of imagery, including individual differences research.
Richman, C.L., Mitchell, D.B., & Reznick, J.S. (1979a). Mental Travel: Some Reservations. Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance (5) 13-18.
Richman, C.L., Mitchell, D.B., & Reznick J.S. (1979b). The Demands of Mental Travel: Demand Characteristics of Mental Imagery Experiments. Behavioral & Brain Sciences (2) 564-565.
Richter, W., Somorjai, R., Summers, R., Jarmaz, M., Menon, R.S., Gati, J.S., Georgopoulos, A.P., Tegeler, C., Ugurbil, K., & Seong-Gi, K. (2000). Motor Area Activity During Mental Rotation Studied by Time-Resolved Single-Trial fMRI. Journal of Cognitive Neuroscience (12) 310-320.
Riddoch, M.J. (1990). Loss of Visual Imagery: A Generation Deficit. Cognitive Neuropsychology (7) 249-273. Case study of a patient with a visual imagery deficit due to brain damage, but with relatively intact memory and perceptual functions. See also: Brain (1954); Basso et al. (1980); Botez et al. (1985); Goldenberg (1992); Young & van de Wal (1996); Moro et al. (2008); Zeman et al. (2010).
Rilling, M.E. & Neiworth, J.J. (1987). Theoretical and Methodological Considerations for the Study of Imagery in Animals. Learning and Motivation (18) 57-79.
Rilling, M.E. & Neiworth, J.J. (1991). How Animals Use Images. Science Progress (75 #298 Pts. 3-4) 439-452. Some evidence suggesting that pigeons are capable of mental rotation (and therefore have mental imagery). However, see Hollard & Delius (1982) and Delius & Hollard (1995) for apparently contradictory findings.
Rimé, B., Shiaratura, L., Hupet, M., & Ghysselinckx, A. (1984). Effects of Relative Immobilization on the Speaker’s Nonverbal Behavior and on the Dialogue Imagery Level. Motivation and Emotion (8) 311-325. See also Wesp et al. (2001), and Smithson & Nicoladis (2014). Supports an embodied view of cognition.
Robinson, W.S. (2005). Thoughts without Distinctive Non-Imagistic Phenomenology. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (70) 534-560. He thinks there aren't any.
Robson, J. (1986). Coleridge's Images of Fantasy and Imagination. In D.G. Russell, D.F. Marks, & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.) Imagery 2 (pp.190-194). Dunedin, New Zealand: Human Performance Associates. Mental imagery in Romantic psychological theory.
Rode, G., Jacquin-Courtois, S., Revol, P., Pisella, L., Sacri, A.S., Boisson, D., & Rossetti, Y. (2007). Bottom-up Effects of Sensory Conflict and Adaptation on Mental Imagery: Sensorimotor Grounds for High Level Cognition? In F. Mast & L. Jäncke (Eds.), Spatial Processing in Navigation, Imagery and Perception (pp. 369-387). New York: Springer US.
Rode, G., Revol, P., Rossetti, Y., Boisson, D., & Bartolomeo, P. (2007). Looking While Imagining: The Influence of Visual Input on Representational Neglect. Neurology (68) 432-437. Available online Representational neglect is not ameliorated by blindfolding the patient. This suggests that the underlying representations responsible for imagery are damaged in this syndrome, rather than the neglect phenomenon being caused by distraction of attention toward the right during the process of image formation or examination.
Rode, G., Rossetti, Y., & Boisson, D. (2001). Prism Adaptation Improves Representational Neglect. Neuropsychologia (39) 1250-1254.
Rode, G., Rossetti, Y., Li, L., & Boisson, D. (1998). Improvement of Mental Imagery after Prism Exposure in Neglect: A Case Study. Behavioural Neurology (11) 251-258.
Rode, G., Rossetti, Y., Perenin, M.-T., & Boisson, D. (2004). Geographic Information Has to Be Spatialised to Be Neglected: A Representational Neglect Case. Cortex (40) 391-397. Further evidence regarding the neurological syndrome of representational neglect in which sufferers fail to report features to one side (usually the left) of an imagined scene (Bisiach & Luzzatti, 1978; Bartolomeo, D'Erme, & Gainotti, 1994). The findings appear to favor both an enactive theory of imagery (Thomas, 1999b; see Bartolomeo, 2002; Bartolomeo & Chokron, 2002) and the Dual Coding theory of the function of imagery in memory (Paivio, 1971, 1986, 2007; Sadoski & Paivio, 2001).
Rodrigo, A.M.L., Piñeiro, M.M.P., Suárez, P.C.M., Caro, M.I., & Giráldez, S.L. (1997). Hallucinations in a Normal Population: Imagery and Personality Influences. Psychology in Spain (1) 10-16. Reprint available online Vivid imagers tend to be more prone to hallucination than are less vivid imagers.
Rodríguez-Ardura, I., & Martínez-López, F.J. (2014). Another Look at ‘Being There’ Experiences in Digital Media: Exploring Connections of Telepresence with Mental Imagery. Computers in Human Behavior (30) 508-518. The role that imagery plays in the feeling of online presence that people may have when using social media, and the implications of this for online marketing strategies.
Rodway, P., Gillies, K., & Schepman, A. (2006). Vivid Imagers Are Better at Detecting Salient Changes. Journal of Individual Differences (27 #4) 218-228.
Roe, A. (1951). A Study of Imagery in Research Scientists. Journal of Personality (19) 459-70. Finds social scientists, in particular, tend to report weak or absent imagery (but see Brewer & Schommer-Aikins, 2006).
Roeckelein, J.E. (2004). Imagery in Psychology: A Reference Guide. Westport, CT: Greenwood Publishing Group. An extensive guide to the psychological literature on imagery.
Roffwarg, H., Dement, W., Muzio, J., & Fisher, C. (1962). Dream Imagery: Relationship to Rapid Eye Movements. Archives of General Psychiatry (7) 235-238.
Roland, P.E. & Gulyàs B. (1994). Visual Imagery and Visual Representation. Trends in Neuroscience (17) 281-286. Suggests that imagery does not depend on activity in the early, retinotopically mapped visual areas of the brain (cf. D'Esposito et al., 1996). For an opposing view see Kosslyn, Alpert et al. (1993), Kosslyn, Thompson et al. (1995), Kosslyn, Pascual-Leone et al. (1999). See Kosslyn & Thompson (2003) for a review of this issue and an attempt to reconcile the conflicting findings.
Rollins, M. (1989). Mental Imagery: On the Limits of Cognitive Science. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press. Considers the possibility of “pictorial attitudes” (analogous to propositional attitudes).
Rollins, M. (1994). Re: Reinterpreting Images. Philosophical Psychology (7) 345-358. See Reisberg (1994) and the annotation to Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Rollins, M. (2001). The Strategic Eye: Kosslyn’s Theory of Imagery and Perception. Minds and Machines (11) 267-286. Essay Review of Image and Brain: The Resolution of the Imagery Debate (Kosslyn, 1994).
Rosenbaum, R.S., McKinnon, M.C., Levine, B., & Moscovitch, M. (2004). Visual Imagery Deficits, Impaired Strategic Retrieval, or Memory Loss: Disentangling the Nature of an Amnesic Person’s Autobiographical Memory Deficit. Neuropsychologia (42) 1619–1635. A severely amnesiac patient with seriously impoverished memory for the events of his own life nevertheless appears to be capable of forming essentially normal visual mental imagery for individual items, even though his brain is damaged in the secondary visual areas as well as (more severely) in the hippocampus.
Roskos-Ewoldsen, B., Intons-Peterson, M.J., & Anderson, R.E. (Eds.) (1993). Imagery, Creativity and Discovery: a Cognitive Perspective. Amsterdam: Elsevier.
Ross, J. & Lawrence, K.A. (1968). Some Observations on Memory Artifice. Psychonomic Science (13) 107-108. An experimental validation of the effectiveness of the classical method of loci mnemonic (see Yates, 1966; Carruthers, 1990; Small, 1997; Rossi, 2000).
Rossi, P. (2000). Logic and the Art of Memory. (Translated by S. Clucas from the original Italian of 1983.) Chicago: University of Chicago Press. Classical, medieval, and early modern imagery mnemonics and their intellectual significance (c.f. Yates, 1966; Spence, 1985; Carruthers, 1990, 1998; Small, 1997).
Rossman, M.L. (2000). Guided Imagery for Self-Healing: An Essential Resource for Anyone Seeking Wellness. Tiburon, CA: HJ Kramer.
Roth, D. (1961). The Roth Memory Course. Santa Monica, CA: Motivation Press. Instruction in the use of mnemonic techniques, particularly imagery-based ones, aimed at a popular audience. There appear to have been many other editions, going back at least as far as 1918, and as recently as 2013. However, this is probably the one that (along with similar works by others, such as Furst (1957) and Lorayne (1957), that were available in the late 1950s and early 1960s) had most influence on the development of the science of imagery.
Roth, R.J. (1963). The Aristotelian Use of Phantasia and Phantasma. The New Scholasticism (37) 312-326.
Rowlands, M. (2006a). Body Language: Representation in Action. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Argues that some actions can be inherently representational, and their intentionality need not be derived from the intentionality of other mental representations. The actions involved in perception (as in O'Regan & Noë's (2001) sensorimotor theory of perception) may be of this type. The sensorimotor approach, despite superficial appearances to the contrary, can account for the phenomenology of imagery even better than more traditional theories.
Roy, D., Hsiao, K.-Y., & Mavridis N. (2004). Mental Imagery for a Conversational Robot. IEEE Transactions on Systems, Man, and Cybernetics – part B: Cybernetics (34) 1374-1383. Preprint available online
Ruggieri, V. (1999). The Running Horse Stops: The Hypothetical Role of the Eyes in Imagery of Movement. Perceptual and Motor Skills (89) 1088-1092.
Ruggieri, V. & Alfieri, G. (1992). The Eyes in Imagery and Perceptual Processes: First Remarks. Perceptual and Motor Skills (75) 287-290. Evidence that imagery can affect the focusing of crystalline lens of eye.
Russeler, J., Scholz, J., Jordan, K., & Quaiser-Pohl, C. (2005). Mental Rotation of Letters, Pictures, and Three-dimensional Objects in German Dyslexic Children. Child Neuropsychology (11) 497-512.
Russell, B. (1919). On Propositions: What They are and How they Mean. Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume (2) 1-43. Reprinted in K. Blackwell (Ed.) (1983). The Collected Papers of Bertrand Russell, Volume 8: the Philosophy of Logical Atomism and Other Essays, 1914-19, (pp. 276-306). London: Allen & Unwin. An imagery based theory of linguistic meaning.
Russell, B. (1921). The Analysis of Mind. London: Allen & Unwin. Re-presents Russell's (1919) imagery based theory of linguistic meaning in the context of a general theory of mind.
Russell, D.G., Marks, D.F., & Richardson, J.T.E. (Eds.) Imagery 2. Dunedin, New Zealand: Human Performance Associates. Proceedings of the Second International Imagery Conference (Swansea, Wales, 1985).
Russow, L.-M. (1978). Some Recent Work on Imagination. American Philosophical Quarterly (15) 57-66.
Russow, L.-M. (1980). Towards a Theory of Imagination. Southern Journal of Philosophy (28) 353-369.
Ryan, E.D. & Simons, J. (1982). Efficacy of Mental Imagery in Enhancing Mental Rehearsal of Motor Skills. Journal of Sport Psychology (4) 41-51. Mental practice (or mental rehearsal) is a technique, now widely used in competitive sport and athletics (particularly at more elite levels), whereby physical skills can supposedly be enhanced through practicing them solely in the imagination. For more on this topic (and other uses of imagery in sport and athletics) see Richardson (1967), Feltz & Landers (1983), Paivio (1985), Sheikh & Korn (1994), Driskell et al. (1994), Morris et al. (2005), Short et al. (2006), Nordin et al. (2006), Weinberg (2008). For a skeptical perspective, see Budney et al. (1994).
Ryba, K., Selby, L., & Brown, R. (2004). Developing Mental Imagery Using a Digital Camera: A Study of Adult Vocational Training. Down Syndrome Research and Practice (9, #1) 1-11. Available online
Ryle, G. (1949). The Concept of Mind. London: Hutchinson. Chapter 8 contains a seminal critique of pictorial accounts of imagery and questions the traditional concept of imagination as the image producing faculty. It is suggested that both imagination and imagery are conceptually related to pretending.
Ryle, G. (1971). Phenomenology versus The Concept of Mind. In his Collected Papers, Volume 1: Critical Essays. London: Hutchinson. Some qualifications of the view expressed in Ryle (1949).
Ryle, G. (1979). On Thinking. Oxford: Blackwell. Chapter 3 deals with “Thought and Imagination”.
Saariluoma, P. & Kalakoski, V. (1998). Apperception and Imagery in Blindfold Chess. Memory (6) 67-90.
Sack, A.T., Camprodon, J.A., Pascual-Leone, A., & Goebel, R. (2005). The Dynamics of Interhemispheric Compensatory Processes in Mental Imagery. Science (308) 702-704. An experiment using transcranial magnetic stimulation (TMS) to explore the differential contribution to cognitive imagery tasks made by the parietal lobes in each of the brain's hemispheres.
Sadoski, M. & Paivio, A. (2001). Imagery and Text: A Dual Coding Theory of Reading and Writing. Mahwah, NJ: Erlbaum. For more on Dual Coding Theory, see above for many other citations to Paivio's work.
Saj, A., Raz, N., Levin, N., Ben-Hur, T., & Arzy, S. (2014). Disturbed Mental Imagery of Affected Body-Parts in Patients with Hysterical Conversion Paraplegia Correlates with Pathological Limbic Activity. Brain Sciences (4 #2) 396-404. Available online
Salenius, S., Kajola, M., Thompson, W.L., Kosslyn, S., & Hari, R. (1995). Reactivity of Magnetic Parieto-occipital Alpha Rhythm During Visual Imagery. Electroencephalography & Clinical Neurophysiology (95, #6) 453-462. A magnetoencephalography study showing that imagery suppresses occipito-parietal alpha rhythm.
Salway, A.F., & Logie, R.H. (1995). Visuospatial Working Memory, Movement Control and Executive Demands. British Journal of Psychology (86) 253-269.
Samuels, M. & Samuels, N. (1975). Seeing with the Mind's Eye: The History, Techniques and Uses of Visualization. New York/Berkeley, CA: Random House/The Bookworks. Not a scholarly work.
Sarbin, T.R. (1972). Imagination as Muted Role Taking. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery, (pp. 333-354). Academic Press. New York. A version of enactive imagery theory, strongly influenced by Ryle (1949).
Sarbin, T.R. & Juhasz, J.B. (1970). Toward a Theory of Imagination. Journal of Personality (38) 52-76. A version of enactive imagery theory (see Thomas, 1999b).
Sartre, J.-P. (1936). Imagination: A Psychological Critique. (Translated from the French by F. Williams, Ann Arbor, MI: University of Michigan Press, 1962.) An insightful critical account of early 20th century European views of imagery and imagination.
Sartre, J.-P. (1940). The Psychology of Imagination. (Translated from the French by B. Frechtman, New York: Philosophical Library, 1948.) Presents Sartre's own positive theory of imagery and imagination. Argues for the intentionality of imagery, and holds that mental images are not inner objects.
Sathian, K. & Zangaladze, A. (2001). Feeling with the Mind's Eye: The Role of Visual Imagery in Tactile Perception. Optometry and Vision Science (78, #5) 276-281. A brain area normally thought to be devoted to visual processing (extrastriate visual cortex near the parieto-occipital fissure) is shown to be activated when someone is trying to discriminate the orientation of an object by touch alone, and this tactile task was disrupted when this brain region was temporarily incapacitated (by transcranial magnetic stimulation). This is interpreted to mean that visual imagery is normally involved in the interpretation of this sort of tactile information.
Savage, C.W. (1975). The Continuity of Perceptual and Cognitive Experiences. In R.K. Siegel & L.J. West (Eds.) (1975). Hallucinations: Behavior, Experience, and Theory (pp. 257-286). New York: Wiley. Argues that perceptual experience, imagery, and hallucination are all phenomena of the same general type, differing in degree rather than kind.
Savazzia, S., Mancinia, F. & Marzi, C.A. (2008). Interhemispheric Transfer and Integration of Imagined Visual Stimuli. Neuropsychologia (46) 803-809.
Scarry, E. (1995). On Vivacity: The Difference Between Daydreaming and Imagining-Under-Authorial-Instruction. Representations (52) 1-26. Imagery and the appreciation of literature. See also: Scarry (1999) and Esrock (1994).
Scarry, E. (1999). Dreaming by the Book. Princeton NJ: Princeton University Press. A literary critic on the power of language to evoke mental imagery, and the importance of such imagery in the proper appreciation of literature. Cf. Esrock (1994).
Schacter, D.L. (1976). The Hypnagogic State: A Critical Review of the Literature. Psychological Bulletin (83 #3) 452-481. A historical reviw of what is known about hypnagogic imagery (a distinctive form of imagery often experienced by people when in a drowsy state before falling asleep).
Scheerer, E. (1984). Motor Theories of Cognitive Structure: A Historical Review. In W.Prinz & A.F. Sanders (Eds.), Cognition and Motor Processes. Berlin/Heidelberg: Springer-Verlag. (pp. 77-98). Includes a brief description of Washburn's (1916) motor theory of imagery.
Schienle, A., Schäfer, A., & Vaitl, D. (2008). Individual Differences in Disgust Imagery: A Functional Magnetic Resonance Imaging Study. NeuroReport (19 #5) 527-530. Relative to picture perception, imagery of both disgusting and happy scenes activated insula, anterior cingulate cortex, and parietal cortex. However, the activation levels in subjects who were more prone to disgust were lower than in the other subjects. No correlation was found between the fMRI measures and VVIQ scores.
Schiff, S.K., Bunney, W.E., & Freedman, D.X. (1961). A Study of Ocular Movements in Hypnotically Induced Dreams. Journal of Nervous and Mental Disease (133) 59-68.
Schifferstein, H.N.J. (2008-9). Comparing Mental Imagery Across the Sensory Modalities. Imagination, Cognition and Personality (28 #4) 371-388.
Schlaegel, T.F. (1953). The Dominant Method of Imagery in Blind as Compared to Sighted Adolescents. Journal of Genetic Psychology (83) 265-277.
Schlick M. (1918). General Theory of Knowledge. (Translation from the 2nd German edition (1925) by A.E. Blumberg, Vienna/New York: Springer-Verlag, 1974.) Argues, on grounds derived from Berkeley, that concepts cannot be rooted in imagery, and that science cannot rely on “knowing by means of images”. Schlick went on to become the leader of the Logical Positivist Vienna Circle.
Schofield, M. (1978). Aristotle on the Imagination. In G.E.R. Lloyd & G.E.L. Owen (Eds.) Aristotle on the Mind and the Senses (pp. 99-140). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Schwitzgebel, E. (2002a). How Well do we Know our Own Conscious Experience? The Case of Visual Imagery. Journal of Consciousness Studies (9, v-vi) 35-53. Reprint available online Argues that we do not have a very good introspective grasp of the nature of our experience of imagery.
Schwitzgebel, E. (2002b). Why Did We Think We Dreamed in Black and White? Studies in History and Philosophy of Science (33) 649-660. Reprint available online Evidence that we we do not have a very good grasp of what our own subjective experience is like.
Schwitzgebel, E. (2008). The Unreliability of Naive Introspection. Philosophical Review (117 #2) 245-273. Reprint available online Argues for taking a very skeptical attitude toward the reliability of introspective reports in general, and those of imagery in particular. Schwitzgebel does not deny that we have conscious experiences (including imagery), but thinks we do not have a good introspective grasp of their detailed subjective character.
Schwitzgebel, E. (2011). Perplexities of Consciousness. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Preprint available online Further elaboration of Schwitzgebel’s strong reservations about the reliability of introspective evidence and the determinateness of experience itself. Chapter 3 is concerned specifically with imagery, and includes a trenchant critique of research on individual differences in imagery vividness, including Galton’s pioneering work (1880, 1883), and Mark’s VVIQ questionnaire (Marks, 1973, 1999; McKelvie, 1995).
Sedman, G. (1966). A Comparative Study of Pseudohallucinations, Imagery and True Hallucinations. British Journal of Psychiatry (112, #482) 9-17. Comparative study of the frequency of these phenomena in mental patients with various diagnoses and in different states of consciousness (clear, half-waking, clouded). Argues that imagery and pseudohallucination (non-deceptive hallucination) are closely related phenomena, differing only in degree, and not pathological, but that "true" visual hallucinations are different, and associated with schizophrenia.
Segal, S.J. (Ed.) (1971a). Imagery: Current Cognitive Approaches. New York: Academic Press.
Segal, S.J. (1971b). Processing of the Stimulus in Imagery and Perception. In S.J. Segal (Ed.) Imagery: Current Cognitive Approaches, (pp. 73-100). New York: Academic Press. On attempting to replicate the Perky (1910) experiment.
Segal, S.J. (1972). Assimilation of a Stimulus in the Construction of an Image: The Perky Effect Revisited. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery, (pp. 203-230). New York & London: Academic Press.
Segal, S.J. & Fusella, V. (1971). Effects of Images in Six Sense Modalities on Detection (d’) of Visual Signal from Noise. Psychonomic Science (24) 55-56.
Segal, S.J. & Nathan, S. (1964). The Perky Effect: Incorporation of an External Stimulus into Imagery Experience under Placebo and Control Conditions. Perceptual and Motor Skills (18) 385-395.
Sergent, J. (1990). The Neuropsychology of Visual Image Generation: Data, Method, and Theory. Brain and Cognition (13) 98-129. Challenges the conclusions of Farah (1984).
Seron, X., Pesenti, M., Noël, M.-P., Deloche, G., & Cornet, J.A. (1992). Images of Numbers, or “When 98 is Upper Left and 6 is Sky Blue.” Cognition (44) 159-196. Introspective reports of "number forms" and related phenomena (see Galton, 1880c, 1883).
Servos P. & Goodale M.A. (1995). Preserved Visual Imagery in Visual Form Agnosia. Neuropsychologia (33 #11) 1383-1394. Evidence from a brain damaged patient that seems to be inconsistent with Kosslyn’s view that imagery is formed in retinotopically mapped early visual cortex. For related neurological findings, pointing to the same conclusion, see Bridge et al. (2012) and the extensive other work cited in the comment thereto.
Shapiro, F. (1989a). Eye Movement Desensitization Procedure: A New Treatment for Post-traumatic Stress Disorder. Journal of Behavior Therapy and Experimental Psychiatry (20) 211-217. Introduces the psychotherapeutic technique known as EMDR (Eye Movement Desensitization and Reprocessing), now widely used as a treatment for post-traumatic stress disorder (PTSD) and other psychological problems. The treatment involves holding a mental image of the traumatic scene in consciousness while one deliberately moves the eyes back and forth. This appears to disrupt the imagery, and reduce its vividness and emotional impact: see Andrade et al. (1997) and the citations listed in the comment thereto.
Shapiro, F. (1989b). Efficacy of the Eye Movement Desensitization Processing in the Treatment of Traumatic Memories. Journal of Traumatic Stress (2) 199-223.
Shapiro, F. (2001). Eye Movement Desensitization and Reprocessing: Basic Principles, Protocols, and Procedures (2nd ed.). New York: Guilford Press. A full length monograph describing and promoting the psychotherapeutic technique known as EMDR (Eye Movement Desensitization and Reprocessing), which is widely used as a treatment for post-traumatic stress disorder (PTSD) and other psychological problems. The treatment involves holding a mental image of the traumatic scene in consciousness while one deliberately moves the eyes back and forth. This appears to disrupt the imagery, and reduce its vividness and emotional impact: see Andrade et al. (1997) and the citations listed in the comment thereto.
Shapiro, F., & Forrest, M.S. (1997). EMDR: The Breakthrough Therapy for Overcoming Anxiety, Stress, and Trauma. New York: Basic Books. A non-technical account of the psychotherapeutic technique of Eye Movement Desensitization and Reprocessing (EMDR), widely used as a treatment for post-traumatic stress disorder (PTSD) and other psychological problems. The treatment involves holding a mental image of the traumatic scene in consciousness while one deliberately moves the eyes back and forth. This appears to disrupt the imagery, and reduce its vividness and emotional impact: see Andrade et al. (1997) and the citations listed in the comment thereto. For a more scholarly treatment of EMDR, see Shapiro (1989a,b, 2001).
Sharpley, C.F., Montgomery, I.M., & Scalzo, L.A. (1996). Comparative Efficacy of EMDR and Alternative Procedures in Reducing the Vividness of Mental Images. Scandinavian Journal of Behaviour Therapy (25) 37-42. Making deliberate eye movements whilst recalling memory imagery reduces its subsequent vividness. For numerous similar, corroboratory, findings see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations given in the comment thereto.
Sheehan, P.W. (1967). A Shortened Version of the Betts' Questionnaire upon Mental Imagery. Journal of Clinical Psychology (23) 386-389. Known as the QMI, and based on Betts (1909), this is a self report questionnaire on subjective imagery vividness, covering imagery of all sense modes. The VVIQ of Marks (1973) restricts itself to asking about the vividness of visual imagery only.
Sheehan, P.W. (Ed.) (1972). The Function and Nature of Imagery. Academic Press. New York & London. Valuable anthology of the state of the art at the time.
Sheehan, P.W. (1978). Mental Imagery. In B.M. Foss (Ed.) Psychology Survey. No.1. London: Allen & Unwin. Good review article, but now very dated.
Sheehan, P.W. & Neisser, U. (1969). Some Variables Affecting the Vividness of Imagery in Recall. British Journal of Psychology (60) 71-80.
Sheffield, F.D. (1961). Theoretical Considerations in the Learning of Complex Sequential Tasks from Demonstration and Practice. In A.A. Lumsdaine (Ed.) Student Response in Programmed Instruction (NAS-NRS Publication No. 943). Washington, DC: National Academy of Sciences—National Research Council. Imagery introduced into an essentially Behaviorist theory.
Sheikh, A.A. (Ed.) (1983). Imagery: Current Theory, Research, and Application. New York: Wiley. Wide ranging collection representing the state of the art at the time.
Sheikh, A.A. (ed.) (2003). Healing Images: The Role of Imagination in Health. Amityville, NY: Baywood. A collection of essays on therapeutic techniques that involve the use of imagery.
Sheikh, A.A. & Korn, E.R. (Eds.) (1994). Imagery in Sports and Physical Performance. Amityville, NY: Baywood.
Shepard, R.N. (1975). Form, Formation, and Transformation of Internal Representations. In R.L. Solso (Ed.) Information Processing and Cognition: the Loyola Symposium. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. Defends an analog account of imagery. Introduces the concept of “second order isomorphism”.
Shepard, R.N. (1978a). Externalization of Mental Images and the Act of Creation. In B.S. Randhawa & B.F. Coffman (Eds.), Visual Learning, Thinking and Communication. London: Academic Press.
Shepard, R.N. (1978b). The Mental Image. American Psychologist (33) 125-137. Probably Shepard's clearest statement of his views about the nature of imagery, its analog nature and its “second order isomorphism” to what it represents.
Shepard, R.N. (1981). Psychophysical Complementarity. In M. Kubovy & J.R. Pomerantz (Eds.) Perceptual Organization. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Shepard, R.N. (1984). Ecological Restraints on Internal Representation. Psychological Review (91) 417-447.
Shepard, R.N. & Chipman, S. (1970). Second Order Isomorphism of Internal Representations: Shapes of States. Cognitive Psychology (1) 1-17.
Shepard, R.N., Cooper, L.A., et al. (1982). Mental Images and Their Transformations. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. A useful compendium of the seminal work by Shepard and his students on the mental rotation of images (and related phenomena).
Shepard, R.N. & Feng, C. (1972). A Chronometric Study of Mental Paper Folding. Cognitive Psychology (3) 228-243. (Reprinted as chapter 9 of Shepard & Cooper et al., 1982.)
Shepard, R.N. & Metzler, J. (1971). Mental Rotation of Three-Dimensional Objects. Science (171) 701-703. A classic psychological experiment. The first, most striking, and best known of the mental rotation studies. Together with the work on the mnemonic effects of imagery (see Paivio, 1971) this played a major role in re-establishing the scientific respectability of imagery research.
Shepard, R.N. & Podgorny, P. (1978). Cognitive Processes That Resemble Perceptual Processes. In W.K. Estes (Ed.) Handbook of Learning and Cognitive Processes. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Shepherd, G.M. (2006). Smell Images and the Flavour System in the Human Brain. Nature (444 #7117) 316-321.Be aware that the term “smell images,” as used here, refers, in the first instance, to neural representations of odors within the brain, not to imaginative, quasi-perceptual experiences of smells. Whether the two can be legitimately conflated remains a highly controversial issue, one that is not addressed in this article.
Sheppard, A. (1991). Phantasia and Mental Images: Neoplatonist Interpretations of De Anima, 3.3. In H. Blumenthal & H. Robinson (Eds.) Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy: Supplementary Volume 1991: Aristotle and the Later Tradition (pp. 165-173). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Sherwood, R., & Pearson, J. (2010). Closing the Mind's Eye: Incoming Luminance Signals Disrupt Visual Imagery. PloS One (5 #12) e15217, doi:10.1371/journal.pone.0015217
Shields, C. (2011). Supplement to Aristotle's Psychology: Imagination. In E.N. Zalta (ed.), The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2011 Edition) Available online
Short, S.E., Ross-Stewart, L., & Monsma, E.V. (2006). Onwards with the Evolution of Imagery Research in Sport Psychology. Athletic Insight: The Online Journal of Sport Psychology (8 #3). Available online For more on the uses of imagery in sport and athletics see: Richardson (1967), Ryan & Simons (1982), Paivio (1985), Sheikh & Korn (1994), Morris et al. (2005), Nordin et al. (2006), Weinberg (2008).
Shorter, J.M. (1952). Imagination. Mind (61) 528-542. Perhaps the earliest suggestion that imagining is more like describing than like seeing a picture (C.f. Dennett, 1969).
Sima, J.F. (2011). The Nature of Mental Images - An Integrative Computational Theory. In L. Carlson, C. Hoelscher, & T.F. Shipley (Eds.), Proceedings of the 33rd Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society, Boston, Massachusetts, July 20-23, 2011 (pp. 2878-2883). Austin, TX: Cognitive Science Society. Available online Presents and defends the “Attention-Based Quantification Theory” of imagery, a form of what is here being called “enactive theory”: see comment on Sima (2014).
Sima, J.F. (2013). A New Theory of Visuo-Spatial Mental Imagery. Perception (42, ECVP Abstract Supplement Issue) 129-130. Available online See comment on Sima (2014).
Sima, J.F. (2014). A Computational Theory of Visuo-Spatial Mental Imagery. Unpublished doctoral dissertation, Universität Bremen, Bremen, Germany. Available online, as html, and as PDF After a general discussion of extant theories of mental imagery, and of the empirical findings they need to be able to explain, Sima presents and defends a version of enactive imagery theory, what he now calls his Perceptual Instantiation Theory, and an implemented computational model of it. In his earlier publications on imagery theory, Sima (2011; Sima & Freksa, 2012) seemingly wanted to distance himself from the “enactive theory” of imagery (by which he apparently meant the specific views expressed by Thomas (1999b)), objecting to it on the grounds that it is excessively “vague”, not being formulated as a computational model. In his more recent publications, however, Sima (2013, 2014) describes his own view, and his computational model, as a “fleshed-out and modified version of the enactive theory of mental imagery” (2013 p. 129). However, this does not so much reflect any fundamental change in his own theory, but rather an evolution in his appreciation of Thomas’ (1999b) work (Sima, personal communication, January 2014). In any case, in this encyclopedia entry I intend the expression “enactive theory” to refer not to the specific theory presented in Thomas (1999b) (which, in fact, does not use the word “enactive”, and refers to the theory it advocates as “Perceptual Activity theory”), but to a broad class of similar theories (of which that is one) as proposed by several, diverse theorists. These theories differ in idiom and in many details, but what they all have in common is that they all depend on a view of perception as an active, exploratory, information-seeking process (as opposed to, essentially, passive reception and “processing” of information), and all reject the identification of mental images with either inner pictures or inner descriptions. Instead, enactive theories of imagery see the experience of imagery as arising from the offline functioning of mechanisms of attentional control and the offline enactment of exploratory perceptual routines. On that basis, I think I am justified in classifying both the earlier (Sima, 2011; Sima & Freksa, 2012) and later (Sima, 2013, 2014) versions of Sima’s theory as examples of enactive theories.
Sima, J.F. & Freksa, C. (2012). Towards Computational Cognitive Modeling of Mental Imagery: The Attention-Based Quantification Theory. KI - Künstliche Intelligenz (26 #3) 261-267. Reprint available online See comment on Sima (2014).
Sima, J.F., Lindner, M., Schultheis, H., & Barkowsky, T. (2010). Eye Movements Reflect Reasoning with Mental Images but Not with Mental Models in Orientation Knowledge Tasks. In C. Hölscher, T.F. Shipley, M. Olivetti Belardinelli, J.A. Bateman, & N.S. Newcombe (Eds.), Spatial Cognition VII (pp. 248-261). Berlin/Heidelberg: Springer. Reprint available online As the enactive theory of imagery might lead one to expect, the pattern of eye movements made during imagery resembles that which would be made during perception of the imagined scene, if it were actually present. For further evidence to this effect see: Brandt & Stark (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment thereto.
Sima, J.F., Schultheis, H., & Barkowsky, T. (2013). Differences between Spatial and Visual Mental Representations. Frontiers in Psychology, 4: 240. doi:10.3389/fpsyg.2013.00240
Simon, H.A. (1972). What is Visual Imagery? An Information Processing Interpretation. In L.W. Gregg (Ed.), Cognition in Learning and Memory. New York: Wiley. Early sketch of a computational model of imagery.
Simpson, P. (1985). Lyons and Tigers. Analysis (45) 169-171. Attempts to rebut Lyons' (1984) critique of the "image indeterminacy" argument against pictorialism due to Shorter (1952) and Dennett (1969). See note 31 to the main entry for an account of this argument and its shortcomings.
Singer, J.L. & Antrobus, J.S. (1965). Eye Movements During Fantasies: Imagining and Suppressing Fantasies. Archives of General Psychiatry (12) 71-76. Deliberately moving the eyes disrupts the experience of imagery. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there.
Skinner, B.F. (1953). Science and Human Behavior. New York: The Free Press. Imagery as “conditioned seeing” or “operant seeing”.
Skinner, B.F. (1974). About Behaviorism. New York: Knopf. Imagery is not an inner representation but a covert behavior.
Skinner, B.F. (1980). Notebooks. (Ed. & Introduction by R. Epstein). Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
Slezak, P. (1991). Can Images be Rotated and Inspected? A Test of the Pictorial Medium Theory. In Proceedings, Thirteenth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society (pp. 55-60). Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. See note at Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Slezak, P. (1992). When Can Visual Images Be Re-Interpreted? Non-Chronometric Tests of Pictorialism. In Proceedings, Fourteenth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society (pp. 124-129). Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. See note at Chambers & Reisberg (1985).
Slezak, P. (1993). Artificial imagery? Computational Intelligence (9) 349-352.
Slezak, P. (1995). The “Philosophical” Case Against Visual Imagery. In P. Slezak, T. Caelli, & R. Clark (Eds.) Perspectives on Cognitive Science: Theories, Experiments and Foundations. Norwood, NJ: Ablex. An empirically well informed philosopher makes the cognitivist case against pictorialism. A valuable supplement to Pylyshyn's arguments.
Slezak, P. (2002) The Tripartite Model of Representation. Philosophical Psychology (13) 239-270.
Slingerland, E. (2003). Effortless Action: Wu-wei as Conceptual Metaphor and Spiritual Ideal in Early China. New York: Oxford University Press. Applies the cognitive metaphor and image schema theory of Lakoff & Johnson (1980, 1999; Johnson, 1987) to the analysis of classical Chinese thought.
Slotnick, S.D., Thompson, W.L., & Kosslyn S.M. (2005). Visual Mental Imagery Induces Retinotopically Organized Activation of Early Visual Areas. Cerebral Cortex (15) 1570-1583.
Small, J.P. (1997). Wax Tablets of the Mind: Cognitive Studies of Memory and Literacy in Classical Antiquity. London & New York: Routledge. Covers classical imagery mnemonics. See also, Yates (1966), Spence (1985), Carruthers, (1990, 1998), Rossi (2000).
Smania, N., Bazoli, F., Piva, D., & Guidetti, G. (1997). Visuomotor Imagery and Rehabilitation of Neglect. Archives of Physical Medicine and Rehabilitation (78) 430-436.
Smithson, L., & Nicoladis, E. (2014). Lending a Hand to Imagery? The Impact of Visuospatial Working Memory Interference Upon Iconic Gesture Production in a Narrative Task. Journal of Nonverbal Behavior (38 #2) 247-258. Evidence suggesting that use of hand gestures can have a facilitatory effect on a cognitive task thought to depend heavily upon imagery. Supports an embodied view of cognition. See also Wesp et al. (2001) and Rimé et al. (1984).
Snoeyenbos, M. & Sibley, E. (1978). Sartre on Imagination. Southern Journal of Philosophy (16) 373-388.
Sober, E. (1976). Mental Representations. Synthése (33) 101-148. Largely a discussion of the possibilities of mental representation via imagery.
Sommer, R. (1978). The Mind's Eye. New York: Delacorte Press. Includes an interesting case study of a “non-imager” .
Sorabji, R. (1972). Aristotle on Memory. Providence, RI: Brown University Press. Imagery played a large role in Aristotle's theory. Sorabji's introduction to Aristotle's text illuminates not just that text, but also the topics of imagery and memory themselves.
Sosa, D. (2006). Scenes Seen. Philosophical Books (47) 314-325. Essay review of McGinn's Mindsight (2004). See McGinn (2006) for reply.
Spalding, J.M.K. & Zangwill, O.L. (1950). Disturbance of Number-Form in a Case of Brain Injury. Journal of Neurology Neurosurgery and Psychiatry (13) 24-29. A case study of a patient whose visual imagery was much impaired (but not entirely lost) due to a brain injury. His visual memory and ability to find his way about were badly impacted. Formerly, he had experienced a strong imaginal "number form" of the sort described by Galton (1880c, 1883; and see Seron et al., 1992). After his injury it became much harder for him to visualize it, and this badly impacted his ability to do arithmetic.
Sparing, R., Mottaghy, F.M., Ganis, G., Thompson, W.L., Töpper, R., Kosslyn, S.M., & Pascual-Leone, A. (2002). Visual Cortex Excitability Increases During Visual Imagery - A TMS Study in Healthy Human Subjects. Brain Research (938) 92-97.
Sparshott, F. (1990). Imagination – The Very Idea. Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism (48) 1-8.
Spence, J.D. (1985). The Memory Palace of Matteo Ricci. New York: Viking Penguin. The story of how Ricci, a late 16th century Jesuit missionary, attempted to introduce European style imagery based mnemonic techniques (see: Yates, 1966; Carruthers, 1990; Small, 1997; Rossi, 2000) into China. Provides quite a detailed account of the elaborate Renaissance mnemonic system that Ricci presented.
Sperry, R.W. (1952). Neurology and the Mind-Brain Problem. American Scientist (40) 291-312. A famous neuroscientist argues for what is essentially a version of the motor theory of mind, on the grounds that it is suggested by what is known (in 1952) about neuroscience, and offers a promising approach to naturalizing consciousness (including, explicitly, mental imagery).
Spiller, M.J. & Jansari, A.S. (2008). Mental Imagery and Synaesthesia: Is Synaesthesia from Internally-Generated Stimuli Possible? Cognition (109) 143-151. Concludes that it may be possible in some synesthetes. There is also some evidence that synesthetes tend to be better at certain imagery tasks than non-synesthetes.
Spivey, M.J. & Geng J.J. (2001). Oculomotor Mechanisms Activated by Imagery and Memory: Eye Movements to Absent Objects. Psychological Research (65) 235-241. Eye movements during imagery re-enact those that would be expected during perception of a similar scene. This lends support to the enactive theory of imagery (Hebb, 1968; Hochberg, 1968; Sarbin & Juhasz, 1970; Neisser, 1976; Thomas, 1999b). For further evidence for re-enactive perceptual behavior during imagery see: Brandt & Stark (1997), Johansson et al. (2005, 2006), Demarais & Cohen (1998), Laeng & Teodorescu (2002), Bensafi et al. (2003), de’Sperati (2003), and Hong et al. (1997).
Spivey, M.J., Tyler, M., Richardson, D.C., & Young, E. (2000). Eye Movements During Comprehension of Spoken Scene Descriptions. In Proceedings of the Twenty-second Annual Meeting of the Cognitive Science Society (pp.487-492). Mawhah, NJ: Erlbaum. Preprint available online Addresses some possible methodological objections to (what would be published as) Spivey & Geng (2001), and argues for an enactive conception of imagery (inspired by Ryle (1949)).
Sprenger, A., Lappe-Osthege, M., Talamo, S., Gais, S., Kimmig, H., & Helmchen, C. (2010). Eye Movements During REM Sleep and Imagination of Visual Scenes. Neuroreport (21 #1) 45-49. Saccadic eye movements made while recalling a mental image, with eyes closed, resemble the REMs of dreaming sleep.
Squires, J.E.R. (1968). Visualising. Mind (77) 58-67.
Sterelny, K. (1986). The Imagery Debate. Philosophy of Science (53) 560-583. A philosopher's take on the analog/propositional debate.
Stich, K. P., Dehnhardt, G., & Mauck, B. (2003). Mental Rotation of Perspective Stimuli in a California Sea Lion (Zalophus Californianus). Brain, Behavior and Evolution (61) 102-112. Evidence for mental imagery in an animal.
Stokes, M., Saraiva, A., Rohenkohl, G., & Nobre, A. C. (2011). Imagery for Shapes Activates Position-Invariant Representations in Human Visual Cortex. Neuroimage (56 #3) 1540-1545.
Stokes, M., Thompson, R., Cusack, R., & Duncan, J. (2009). Top-Down Activation of Shape-Specific Population Codes in Visual Cortex during Mental Imagery. Journal of Neuroscience (29 #5) 1565-1572.
Strawson, P.F. (1971). Imagination and Perception. In L. Foster & J.L. Swanson (Eds.), Experience and Theory (pp. 31-54). London: Duckworth. Kant's theory of the imagination.
Stromeyer, C.F. (1970). Eidetikers. Psychology Today (November 1970) 76-80. The story of a very atypical adult eidetiker (but see the comment on Stromeyer & Psotka (1970)). This article publicized Elizabeth's unbelievable alleged feats to a mass audience. An abridged version is reprinted by Neisser (1982).
Stromeyer, C.F. & Psotka, J. (1970). The Detailed Texture of Eidetic Imagery. Nature (225) 346-349. A famous and spectacular demonstration of the abilities of an alleged "super-eidetiker" (known by the pseudonym Elizabeth) who is reported to have been able to use her eidetic powers to fuse the two halves of a random-dot stereogram, each seen on different occasions, so as to see the emergent three-dimensional figure. (Other people see the 3-D figure in such a stereogram only when the two halves are presented seperately but simultaneously, one to either eye.) The methodology of this study, however, has been called into question (Blakemore et al., 1970), determined searching has failed to find anyone else capable of comparable feats (Merritt, 1979), and Elizabeth herself has never consented to be re-tested.
Strosahl, K.D. & Ascough, J.C. (1981). Clinical Uses of Mental Imagery: Experimental Foundations, Theoretical Misconceptions, and Research Issues. Psychological Bulletin (89) 422-138.
Stucki, D. J., & Pollack, J. B. (1992). Fractal (Reconstructive Analogue) Memory. In Proceedings, Fourteenth Annual Conference of the Cognitive Science Society. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum. A proposal for a format for the deep representation within a connectionist implementation of a quasi-pictorial theory of imagery.
Suedfeld, P. & Coren, S. (1989). Perceptual Isolation, Sensory Deprivation, and Rest: Moving Introductory Psychology Texts out of the 1950s. Canadian Psychology (30 #1) 17-29. This paper is highly critical of claims by Bexton, Heron & Scott (1954) (and others) to have found that prolonged sensory deprivation often gives rise to bizarre and vivid hallucinations. However, especially when read in the light of Suedfeld & Vernon (1964), it becomes apparent that the disagreement is not substantive, but is merely about how narrowly the word "hallucination" should be understood. Suedfeld and his collaborators do not deny that sensory deprivation often gives rise to bizarre and vivid imagery.
Suedfeld, P. & Vernon, J. (1964). Visual Hallucinations During Sensory Deprivation: A Problem of Criteria. Science (145) 412-413. See comment on Suedfeld & Coren (1989).
Sunderland, A. (1990). The Bisected Image? Visual Memory in Patients With Visual Neglect. In P.J. Hampson, D.F. Marks & J.T.E. Richardson (Eds.), Imagery: Current Developments (pp. 333-350). London: Routledge.
Svensson, H., Thill, S., & Ziemke, T. (2013). Dreaming of Electric Sheep? Exploring the Functions of Dream-Like Mechanisms in the Development of Mental Imagery Simulations. Adaptive Behavior (21 #4) 222-238. Mental imagery as simulation (in the sense of Hesslow (2002)), and the simulation of dreaming in a robot.
Szpunar, K.K., Watson, J.M., & McDermott, K.B. (2007). Neural Substrates of Envisioning the Future. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences of the U.S.A. (104 #2) 642-647. The envisioning in question is presumed to depend upon and to be experienced as mental imagery. This is controlled for, however, because the focus of interest in the experiment is what brain regions are specifically involved in envisioning possible future (rather than past) events.
Taylor, J.G. (1973). A Behavioural Theory of Images. South African Journal of Psychology (3) 1-10. A rare attempt to assimilate imagery into Behaviorist theory, but see also Skinner (1953, 1974).
Taylor, P. (1981). Imagination and Information. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research (42) 205-223. Despite arguments to the contrary from Sartre and Wittgenstein, we can gain new information from our mental imagery.
Teng, N.Y. (1998). The Depictive Nature of Visual Mental Imagery. Presented at the 20th World Congress of Philosophy, August 6-10 1998, Boston, MA. Available online
Terlecki, M.S. & Newcombe, N.S. (2005). How Important Is the Digital Divide? The Relation of Computer and Videogame Usage to Gender Differences in Mental Rotation Ability. Sex Roles (53) 433-441.
Thirion, B., Duchesnay, E., Hubbard, E., Dubois, J., Poline, J.-B., Lebihan, D., & Dehaene, S. (2006). Inverse Retinotopy: Inferring the Visual Content of Images from Brain Activation Patterns. NeuroImage (33) 1104-1116. Shows that it is possible to infer the content of (simple, static, and stereotyped) visual stimuli, and of mental images of them, from neural activation patterns in visual cortex.
Thomas, N.J.T. (1987). The Psychology of Perception, Imagination and Mental Representation, and Twentieth Century Philosophies of Science. Ph.D. thesis, Leeds University, Leeds, U.K. (A.S.L.I.B. Index to Theses 37-iii No. 37-4561). Available online
Thomas, N.J.T. (1989). Experience and Theory as Determinants of Attitudes toward Mental Representation: The Case of Knight Dunlap and the Vanishing Images of J.B. Watson. American Journal of Psychology (102) 395-412. Preprint available online (also here) Discusses the historical circumstances surrounding the “banishment” of imagery from psychological theory in the Behaviorist tradition, and considers certain conceptual confusions that may induce some people to discount the psychological significance of imagery. Dunlap's (1914) theory is outlined.
Thomas, N.J.T. (1997a). Imagery and the Coherence of Imagination: a Critique of White. Journal of Philosophical Research, (22) 95-127. Preprint available online Defends the traditional (Aristotelian) view of the concept of imagination as derivative from the concept of imagery, and argues that the root concept of both is perceiving as. Traces resistance to the Aristotelian view to unsupported pictorialist assumptions. For an alternative (but not incompatible) defense of the conceptual connection between imagination and imagery see Kind (2001).
Thomas, N.J.T. (1997b). A Stimulus to the Imagination.Psyche (3) Available online An essay review of Ellis (1995), which reviews some standard objections to the sort of imagery based semantics he proposes, and sets this idea of an imagery theory of meaning in its historical context.
Thomas, N.J.T. (1999a). Imagination. In C. Eliasmith (Ed.), Dictionary of Philosophy of Mind. Available online Provides a brief sketch of the history of the concept, from Aristotle to the present.
Thomas, N.J.T. (1999b). Are Theories of Imagery Theories of Imagination? An Active Perception Approach to Conscious Mental Content. Cognitive Science (23) 207-245. Preprint available online (also here) Discusses cognitive theories of imagery in the light of their relevance to theories of imagination and its role in creative thought. Proposes and defends a “perceptual activity” (enactive) theory of imagery, arguing that is both empirically and conceptually superior to both quasi-pictorial and propositional theories.
Thomas, N.J.T. (2002). The False Dichotomy of Imagery. Behavioral and Brain Sciences (25) 211. Preprint available online A commentary on Pylyshyn (2002a).
Thomas, N.J.T. (2003). Mental Imagery, Philosophical Issues About. In L. Nadel (Ed.), Encyclopedia of Cognitive Science (Volume 2, pp. 1147-1153). London: Nature Publishing/Macmillan. (Republished in 2005: Hoboken, NJ: Wiley.) Preprint available online
Thomas, N.J.T. (2006). Fantasi, Eliminatiisme og Bevidsthedens Forhistorie. Slagmark: Tidsskrift for Idéhistorie (46) 15-31. (In Danish, but an English preprint version, “Imagination, Eliminativism, and the Pre-History of Consciousness,” is available online.)
Thomas, N.J.T. (2009). Visual Imagery and Consciousness. In W.P. Banks (Ed.). Encyclopedia of Consciousness (volume 2, pp. 445-457). Oxford: Elsevier/Academic Press. Preprint available online
Thomas, N.J.T. (2014). The Multidimensional Spectrum of Imagination: Images, Dreams, Hallucinations, and Active, Imaginative Perception. Humanities (3 #2) 132-184. Available online Presents a general, non-deflationary, scientifically informed philosophical theory of the imagination and its cognitive function, and how such apparently diverse imaginative phenomena such as imagery, hallucinations, dreams, “imaginative seeing”, “imagining that”, and imaginative creativity relate to one another as aspects or derivatives of a single, coherent mental faculty. This is developed out of a detailed critique of McGinn’s (2004) theory of imagination, and particularly of his arguments to the effect that mental imagery is a phenomenon different in kind (not just degree) from perception. The article also includes a critique, based in part upon recent empirical discoveries about the ubiquity and functional importance of eye movements, of the “passive” Cartesian theory of perception, which, in its modern form, is known as “information processing” theory, and is often treated as scientific orthodoxy.
Thompson, E. (2007a). Look Again: Phenomenology and Mental Imagery. Phenomenology and the Cognitive Sciences (6) 137-170.
Thompson, E. (2007b). Mind in Life: Biology, Phenomenology, and the Sciences of Mind. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press. Chapter 10 deals with mental imagery as a conscious phenomenon.
Thompson, E. (2008). Representationalism and the Phenomenology of Mental Imagery. Synthése (160) 397-415. Argues that imagery experience is not the experience of a phenomenal mental picture inspected by the mind’s eye, but rather the mental simulation of perceptual experience. Also claims that there are experiential differences in perceiving and imagining byond any differences in the properties represented by these experiences.
Thompson, W.L., Kosslyn, S.M., Hoffman, M.S., & van Der Kooij, K. (2008). Inspecting Visual Mental Images: Can People "See" Implicit Properties as Easily in Imagery and Perception? Memory and Cognition (36 #5) 1024-1032. It is possible to see previously unnoted features in images of simple, very familiar shapes (letters of the alphabet).
Thorndike, E.L. (1907). On the Function of Visual Images. Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods (4, #12) 324-327, A paper skeptical about the functional importance of imagery even before Watson's famous critique (1913a,b). Argues that there may be no connection between subjective imagery vividness and visual memory performance, and reports an experiment that failed to find any such correlation.
Thorndike, E.L. (1914). Educational Psychology (Volume III). New York: Teachers College, Columbia University. Chapter 16 is a powerful critique of the theory of imagery types that was influential amongst early 20th century psychologists (e.g., Angell, 1906 chap. 8; Fernald, 1912). See also Griffits (1927).
Tippett, L.J. (1992). The Generation of Visual Images: A Review of Neuropsychological Research and Theory. Psychological Bulletin (112) 415-432.
Titchener, E.B. (1901-5). Experimental Psychology: A Manual of Laboratory Practice (4 volumes). New York: Macmillan.
Titchener, E.B. (1909). Lectures on the Experimental Psychology of the Thought-Processes. New York: Macmillan. A radical defense of an image and sensation centered introspective psychology against the claims of the Würzburg imageless thought school of introspectors.
Titchener, E.B. (1914). On "Psychology as the Behaviorist Views It." Proceedings of the American Philosophical Society (53) 1-17. Titchener's critical response to Watson's "Behaviorist manifesto" (1913a) and his Image and Affection in Behavior (1913b), defending introspective psychology in general, and the reality and scientific significance of imagery in particular, from Watson's polemic.
Tomasino, B., Borroni, P., Isaja, A., & Rumiati, R.I. (2005). The Role of the Primary Motor Cortex in Mental Rotation: A TMS Study. Cognitive Neuropsychology (22) 348-363.
Tong, F. (2013). Imagery and Visual Working Memory: One and the Same? Trends in Cognitive Sciences (17 #10) 489-490.
Totten, E. (1935). Eye Movement During Visual Imagery. Comparative Psychology Monographs (11 #53). Evidence that the eye movements involved in visually imagining an object tend to approximate those used in its original perception. This accords with the expectations of the “motor” or “enactive” theory of imagery (see §4.5). For more up-to-date and extensive evidence concerning the role of eye movements in visual imagery, see Brandt & Stark (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment thereto.
Tree, J. (2011). Mental Imagery in Congenital Prosopagnosia: A Reply to Grüter et al.. Cortex (47 #4) 514-518. See Grüter, Grüter, Bell & Carbon (2009); Tree & Wilkie (2010); Grüter, Grüter & Carbon (2011).
Tree, J.J. & Wilkie, J. (2010). Face and Object Imagery in Congenital Prosopagnosia: A Case Series. Cortex (46 #9) 1189-1198. Evidence that congenital prosopagnosics (people with "face blindness") have impaired imagery for faces, but not for other sorts of things (but see Grüter et al. (2009); Grüter, Grüter & Carbon (2011)).
Trehub, A. (1977). Neuronal Models for Cognitive Processes: Networks for Learning, Perception and Imagination. Journal of Theoretical Biology (65) 141-169. A neuroscientific account of imagery, that identifies it with activity in the retinotopic maps of the visual areas of the brain. Trehub (1991) provides a revised and more detailed version of the theory, which seems broadly consistent with the quasi-pictorial theory of Kosslyn (1980, 1994).
Trehub, A. (1991). The Cognitive Brain. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Ambitious and detailed neuroscientific theory, that, consistently with Kosslyn (1994), regards imagery as activity in the retinotopic maps of the brain's visual cortex.
Trojano, L. & Grossi, D. (1994) A Critical Review of Mental Imagery Defects. Brain and Cognition (24) 213-243.
Troscianko, E. (2010). Kafkaesque Worlds in Real Time. Language and Literature (19) 151-171. Applies an enactivist understanding of imagery, imagination and perception to the understanding of literature (with particular reference, here, to the works of Kafka). See also Troscianko (2013, 2014a,b).
Troscianko, E.T. (2013). Reading Imaginatively: The Imagination in Cognitive Science and Cognitive Literary Studies. Journal of Literary Semantics (42 #2) 181-198. Argues that not only can the psychology of imagery illuminate literature, but that considering theories of imagery in the light of their application to literature can help us to adjudicate between them. Also argues that imagery questionnaires such as the VVIQ (Marks, 1973) incorporate implicit pictorialist assumptions. An individual is described who rated himself as a non-imager when filling out the VVIQ, but who seemed to have strong imaginative responses to certain literary passages. See also Troscianko (2010, 2014a,b).
Troscianko, E.T. (2014a). Kafka's Cognitive Realism. New York: Routledge. This book explores how the enactive theory of imagery, imagination and perception (Thomas, 1999b,2009 – and see §4.5.1 of this encyclopedia entry; Noë, 2004, 2009) can illuminate our understanding of the effects of literary works on the reader’s imagination (with particular reference to the works of Kafka). See also Troscianko (2010, 2013, 2014b). For other attempts to apply findings and theories from the science of mental imagery to the study of literature and response to literature, see: Collins (1991); Esrock (1994); Scarry (1995, 1999); Zitlow (2000).
Troscianko, E.T. (2014b). Reading Kafka Enactively. Paragraph (37) 15-31. More about how an enactivist approach to imagery, imagination and perception can be applied to the study of literature and readers' responses to literature, focusing on the particular example of Kafka. See also Troscianko (2010, 2013, 2014a).
Turnbull, K. (1994). Aristotle on Imagination: De Anima iii 3. Ancient Philosophy (14) 319-334.
Tusek, D.L., Church, J.M., Strong, S.A., Grass, J.A., & Fazio, V.W. (1997). Guided Imagery: A Significant Advance in the Care of Patients Undergoing Elective Colorectal Surgery. Diseases of the Colon and Rectum (40) 172-178. Imagery used effectively in preparation of patients for surgery.
Tweedale, M.M. (1990). Mental Representations in Later Medieval Scholasticism. In J.-C. Smith (Ed.), Historical Foundations of Cognitive Science. Dordrecht, Netherlands: Kluwer.
Tweney, R.D. (1987). Programmatic Research in Experimental Psychology: E.B. Titchener's Laboratory Investigations, 1891-1927. In M.G. Ash & W.R. Woodward (Eds.), Psychology in Twentieth Century Thought and Society (pp.34-57). Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Tweney, R.D., Doherty, M.E., & Mynatt, C.R. (Eds.) (1981). On Scientific Thinking. New York: Columbia University Press. Contains anecdotal but very suggestive extracts concerning the key role that imagery can play in the thought processes of scientists.
Tye, M. (1984). The Debate About Mental Imagery. Journal of Philosophy (81) 678-691. An adverbial account of imagery that is abandoned in Tye's later writings on the subject. See Rabb (1975), Heil (1982), and Meijsing (2006) for alternative defenses of the adverbial theory.
Tye, M. (1988). The Picture Theory of Mental Images. Philosophical Review (97) 497-520. A persuasive defense of quasi-pictorial theory against descriptionist criticisms.
Tye, M. (1991). The Imagery Debate. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. This fills out the argument of Tye (1988) and gives an admirably clear philosophical account of the analog/propositional debate and the conceptual basis of (quasi-)pictorialism. However, it fails to look seriously beyond this context, and is occasionally unreliable on historical and empirical issues.
Tyndall, J. (1872). On the Scientific Use of the Imagination. In his Fragments of Science (4th ed.) (pp. 125-161). London: Longmans, Green & Co. A distinguished 19th century physicist discusses the role of imagery in scientific thinking.
van den Hout, M.A., Engelhard, I.M., Rijkeboer, M.M., Koekebakker, J., Hornsveld, H., Leer, A., Toffolo, M.B.J., & Akse, N. (2011). EMDR: Eye Movements Superior to Beeps in Taxing Working Memory and Reducing Vividness of Recollections. Behaviour Research and Therapy (49 #2) 92-98. Deliberately moving the eyes whilst maintaining a visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness and emotional impact of the image. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there.
van den Hout, M., Muris, P., Salemink, E., & Kindt, M. (2001). Autobiographical Memories Become less Vivid and Emotional after Eye Movements. British Journal of Clinical Psychology (40 #2) 121-130. Deliberately moving the eyes whilst maintaining a visual image in consciousness reduces the subsequent vividness and emotional impact of the image. For further corroboration see Andrade et al. (1997) and the other citations listed in the comment there.
Vanlierde, A. & Wanet-Defalque, M.C. (2004). Abilities and Strategies of Blind and Sighted Subjects in Visuo-Spatial Imagery. Acta Psychologica (116) 205-222.
Vannucci, M. & Mazzoni, G. (2006). Dissociative Experiences and Mental Imagery in Undergraduate Students: When Mental Images Are Used to Foresee Uncertain Future Events. Personality and Individual Differences (41 #6) 1143-1153.
Van't Hoff, J. H. (1878). Imagination in Science. (Anonymous English translation: Berlin: Springer-Verlag, 1967.) A distinguished 19th century chemist argues for the importance of imagery in scientific thinking.
Vauclair, J., Fagot, J., & Hopkins, W. (1993). Rotation of Mental Images in Baboons when the Visual Input is Directed to the Left Cerebral Hemisphere. Psychological Science (4 #2) 99-103.
Vecchi, T. (1998). Visuo-Spatial Imagery in Congenitally Totally Blind People. Memory (6) 91-102.
von Eckardt, B. (1984). Mental Images and their Explanations. Journal of Philosophy (81) 691-693. A rejoinder to Tye (1984) – and one he seems to have taken to heart (see Tye, 1988, 1991).
von, Eckardt, B. (1988). Mental Images and Their Explanations. Philosophical Studies (53) 441-460. A further critique of Tye's (1984) adverbial theory, and a defense of quasi-pictorialism.
von Eckardt, B. (1993). What is Cognitive Science? Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. Presents Kosslyn's research on imagery, and his quasi-pictorial theory (Kosslyn, 1980), as a paradigmatic example of Cognitive Science.
von Morstein, P. (1974). Imagine. Mind (83) 228-247.
Wallace, B. (1980). Autokinetic Movement of an Imagined and a Hypnotically Hallucinated Stimulus. International Journal of Clinical and Experimental Hypnosis (28) 386-393. Subject to the same objections (perhaps a fortiori) as Wallace (1984).
Wallace, B. (1984). Apparent Equivalence between Perception and Imagery in the Production of Various Visual Illusions. Memory and Cognition (12) 156-162. These results have been severely criticised as likely products of experimental demand characteristics, rather than real cognitive effects (Predebon & Wenderoth, 1985; Reisberg & Morris, 1985). However, Pressey & Wilson (1974) obtained similar results from a better designed experiment.
Waller, D., Schweitzer, J.R., Brunton, J.R., & Knudson, R.M. (2012). A Century of Imagery Research: Reflections on Cheves Perky's Contribution to Our Understanding of Mental Imagery. American Journal of Psychology (125 #3) 291-305.
Walton, K.L. (1990). Mimesis as Make Believe: On the Foundations of the Representational Arts. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Warnock, M. (1976). Imagination. London: Faber & Faber. See comment to Warnock (1994).
Warnock, M. (1994). Imagination and Time. Oxford: Blackwell. In contrast to many other post-Wittgensteinian philosophers, Warnock depicts the imagination as a coherent, unified mental faculty, that both plays a crucial role in perception and, through imagery, enables us to recall the past and envisage the future. She also deals with the creative and aesthetic roles of imagination.
Washburn, M.F. (1914). The Function of Incipient Motor Process. Psychological Review (21) 376-390. Available online The motor theory of imagery (elaborated in more detail in Washburn (1916)).
Washburn, M.F. (1916). Movement and Mental Imagery. Boston, MA: Houghton Mifflin. Available online A motor theory of imagery. See Dunlap (1914) for another version.
Washburn, M.F., Hatt, E., & Holt, E.B. (1925). The Correlation of a Test of Visual Imagery with Estimated Geometrical Ability. American Journal of Psychology (34) 103-105. A positive correlation was found between scores on a test of control of visual imagery (devised by Washburn) and instructors' estimates of individual students' ability at geometery.
Watson, G. (1982). Phantasia in Aristotle, De Anima 3.3. Classical Quarterly (32) 100-113.
Watson, G. (1988). Phantasia in Classical Thought. Galway, Eire: Galway University Press.
Watson, J.B. (1913a). Psychology as the Behaviorist Views It. Psychological Review (20) 158-177. Reprint available online The classic “Behaviorist manifesto”. Questions the very existence of imagery.
Watson, J.B. (1913b). Image and Affection in Behavior. Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods (10) 421-8. A more careful and detailed version of the anti-imagery position put forward in Watson (1913a).
Watson, J.B. (1928). The Ways of Behaviorism. New York: Harper. Reports of memory images are “sheer bunk”.
Weber, R.J. & Brown, S. (1986). Musical Imagery. Music Perception (3) 411-426.
Wedin, M.V. (1988). Mind and Imagination in Aristotle. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
Weinberg, R. (2008). Does Imagery Work? Effects on Performance and Mental Skills. Journal of Imagery Research in Sport and Physical Activity (3 #1) Article 1, 3-21. doi:10.2202/1932-0191.1025 [available online] This article is concerned with the use of imagery techniques in training and preparing for sport and athletic competition. This is now a widespread practice, especially at elite levels, and a significant and growing topic for research. (The journal in which this article appears, which commenced publication in 2006, is entirely devoted to the subject.) For more on the uses of imagery in sport and athletics see: Richardson (1967), Ryan & Simons (1982), Feltz & Landers (1983), Paivio (1985), Sheikh & Korn (1994), Driskell et al. (1994), Morris et al. (2005), Short et al. (2006), Nordin et al. (2006). For a skeptical perspective, see Budney et al. (1994).
Wekker, L.M. (1966). On the Basic Properties of the Mental Image and a General Approach to their Analogue Simulation. In Psychological Research in the U.S.S.R. Moscow: Progress Publishers. Imagery theory in the Soviet psychological tradition. Somewhat similar to the motor theories of Dunlap (1914) and Washburn (1916).
Wesp, R., Hesse, J., Keutmann, D., & Wheaton, K. (2001). Gestures Maintain Spatial Imagery. American Journal of Psychology (114 #4) 591-600. Evidence that that spatial imagery serves a short-term memory function during lexical search and that gestures may help maintain spatial images. Supports an embodied view of cognition. See also Smithson & Nicoladis (2014) and Rimé et al. (1984).
Wexler, M., Kosslyn, S.M., & Berthoz, A. (1998). Motor Processes in Mental Rotation. Cognition (68) 77-94.
Wheeler, M.E., Petersen, S.E., & Buckner, R.L. (2000). Memory's Echo: Vivid Remembering Reactivates Sensory Specific Cortex. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences of the U.S.A. (97) 11125-11129.
White, A.R. (1990). The Language of Imagination. Oxford: Blackwell. Part 1 is an excellent, if selective, concise history of the concept of imagination. Part 2 argues (in the teeth of the strong historical consensus detailed in part 1) that there is no conceptual connection whatsoever between imagination and imagery. See Thomas (1997a) for a critique of this view.
White, K. (1985). The Meaning of Phantasia in Aristotle's De Anima, III, 3-8. Dialogue (24) 483-505.
Wiesmann, M. & Ishai, A. (2010). Training Facilitates Object Recognition in Cubist Paintings. Frontiers in Human Neuroscience (4 #11): Available online fMRI evidence that top-down processes also associated with imagery are involved in the interpretation of "ambiguous" stimuli, such as cubist paintings.
Willard, R.D. (1977). Breast Enlargement Through Visual Imagery and Hypnosis. American Journal of Clinical Hypnosis (19) 195-200.
Winawer, J., Huk, A., & Boroditsky, L. (2010). A Motion Aftereffect from Visual Imagery of Motion. Cognition (114) 276-284.
Winch, W.H. (1908). The Function of Images. Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods (5 #13) 337-352. Argues that because some cognitively competent people (such as himself) do not experience imagery, it can serve little or no cognitive function.
Wittgenstein, L. (1953). Philosophical Investigations. (Ed. G.E.M. Anscombe & R. Rhees, Trans. G.E.M. Anscombe.). Oxford: Blackwell. Contains a powerful and very influential critique of the imagery theory of linguistic meaning.
Wittgenstein, L. (1958). The Blue and Brown Books. (Ed. R. Rhees.). Oxford: Blackwell. Opens with a critique of the imagery theory of linguistic meaning.
Wittgenstein, L. (1967). Zettel. (Ed. G.E.M. Anscombe & G.H. von Wright; Trans. G.E.M. Anscombe.). Oxford: Blackwell.
Wittgenstein, L. (1980a). Remarks on the Philosophy of Psychology: Volume 1. (Ed. G.E.M. Anscombe & G.H. von Wright; Trans. G.E.M. Anscombe.). Oxford: Blackwell.
Wittgenstein, L. (1980b). Remarks on the Philosophy of Psychology: Volume 2. (Ed. G.H. von Wright & H. Nyman; Trans. C.G. Luckhardt & M.A.E. Aue.). Oxford: Blackwell. This posthumous compilation of Wittgenstein's notes includes many scattered remarks or brief discusions about imagery (volume 1 of the Remarks and the Last Writings also contain a few). Most of the best points probably found their way into the Philosophical Investigations or Zettel, however.
Wittgenstein, L. (1990). Last Writings on the Philosophy of Psychology. (Ed. G.H. von Wright & H. Nyman, Trans. C.G. Luckhardt & M.A.E. Aue.) Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
Wohlschläger A. (2001). Mental Object Rotation and the Planning of Hand Movements. Perception & Psychophysics (63 #4) 709-718. Planning of hand movements interferes with a mental rotation task. This suggests that mental rotation is an imagined (covert) action, rather than a pure visual-spatial imagery task.
Wollock, J. (1997). The Noblest Animate Motion: Speech, Physiology and Medicine in Pre-Cartesian Linguistic Thought. Amsterdam: John Benjamins.
Wraga, M. & Kosslyn, S.M. (2003). Imagery. In L. Nadel (Ed.) Encyclopedia of Cognitive Science, (Vol. 2, pp. 466-470). London: Nature Publishing/Macmillan. A concise but superficial introduction to the cognitive science of imagery.
Wright, E. (1983). Inspecting Images. Philosophy (58) 57-72.
Wundt, W. (1912). An Introduction to Psychology (2nd edn.). New York: Macmillan. (Translated from the German.)
Yates, F.A. (1966). The Art of Memory. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul. A celebrated and seminal history of mnemonic uses of imagery, from ancient to early modern times. Argues that such techniques have had a previously unrecognized importance in the history of western intellectual life. For more recent work on these issues see Spence (1985), Carruthers, (1990, 1998), Small (1997), and Rossi (2000).
Yolton, J.W. (1956). John Locke and the Way of Ideas. Oxford: Oxford University Press. See comment on Yolton (1996).
Yolton, J.W. (1970). Locke and the Compass of Human Understanding. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. See comment on Yolton (1996).
Yolton, J.W. (1984). Perceptual Acquaintance from Descartes to Reid. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press. See comment on Yolton (1996).
Yolton, J.W. (1985). Locke: An Introduction. Oxford: Blackwell. See comment on Yolton (1996).
Yolton, J.W. (1996). Perception and Reality: A History from Descartes to Kant. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press. Argues that the ideas of Locke (and, indeed, those of Hume) should not be understood to be mental images (i.e., pictures). See also Yolton (1956, 1970, 1984, 1985). For similar arguments see Chappell (1994), and Lowe (1995, 2005). For the opposing view see Ayers (1986, 1991), White (1990), or Price (1953).
Yomogida, Y., Sugiura, M., Watanabe, J., Akitsuki, Y., Sassa, Y., Sato, T., Matsue, Y., & Kawashima, R. (2004). Mental Visual Synthesis is Originated in the Fronto-temporal Network of the Left Hemisphere. Cerebral Cortex (14) 1376-1383. “Visual mental synthesis” is here used to mean the production of “imagination imagery” of novel objects by the combination of parts or aspects of mental images of familiar objects.
Yoo, S.-S., Freeman, D.K., McCarthy J.J.III, & Jolesz, F.A. (2003). Neural Substrates of Tactile Imagery: A Functional MRI Study. NeuroReport (14 #4) 581-585. Imagery of a simple touch sensation leads to activity in primary and secondary somatosensory cortex (along with several other brain areas, some of which are not activated by an actual touch sensation of the same sort).
Yoon, D., & Narayanan, N.H. (2004). Mental Imagery in Problem Solving: An Eye Tracking Study. In A. Duchowski & R. Vertegaal (Eds.). Proceedings of the Third ACM Symposium on Eye Tracking Research & Applications ( pp. 77-83). New York: ACM Press.
Young, A. & van de Wal, C. (1996). Charcot's Case of Impaired Imagery. In C. Code, C.-W. Wallesch, Y. Joanette, & A.R. Lecours (Eds.), Classic Cases in Neuropsychology (pp. 31-44). Hove, UK: Psychology Press. An account of what may be the earliest scientific case study of mental imagery being impaired by brain injury without there also being severe damage to perceptual function. Such cases seem to be rare, but other, more recent ones are described by: Brain (1954); Basso et al. (1980); Botez et al. (1985); Goldenberg (1992); Riddoch (1990); Moro et al. (2008); and Zeman et al. (2010).
Yuille, J.C. (Ed.) (1983a). Imagery, Memory and Cognition: Essays in Honour of Allan Paivio. Hillsdale, NJ: Erlbaum.
Yuille, J.C. (1983b). The Crisis in Theories of Mental Imagery. In J.C. Yuille (Ed.), Imagery, Memory and Cognition: Essays in Honour of Allan Paivio (pp. 263-284). Hillsdale NJ: Erlbaum.
Zago, S., Corti, S., Bersano, A., Baron, P., Conti, G., Ballabio, E., Lanfranconi, S., Cinnante, C., Costa, A., Cappellari, A., & Bresolin, N. (2010). A Cortically Blind Patient With Preserved Visual Imagery. Cognitive & Behavioral Neurology (23 #1) 44-48. Neurological evidence inconsistent with Kosslyn’s (1994, 2005; Kosslyn, Thompon & Ganis, 2006) claims that visual mental images are instantiated in the retinotopic maps of early visual cortex, in the occipital lobe. These brain areas can be destroyed, leading to full or partial blindness, without imagery being significantly impaired. For similar and related corroboratory neurological findings see: Chatterjee & Southwood (1995); Servos & Goodale, 1995; Goldenberg et al. (1995); Dulin et al. (2008); Bridge et al. (2012); Bartolomeo et al. (2013). Further corroboration of the point comes from the many reports of patients rendered blind in part of their visual field due to damage to the corresponding part of their retinotopically mapped visual cortex, but who nevertheless experience vivid, well formed visual hallucinations (Charles Bonnet syndrome) in precisely those parts of the visual field where they have been blinded: Weiskrantz et al. (1974); Lance, (1976); Kölmel (1985); Ramachandran & Hirstein (1997); Kleiter et al. (2007); Ashwin & Tsaloumas, (2007). (Such visual hallucinations are best interpreted as a form of mental imagery that has escaped volitional control (Thomas, 2014).)
Zemach, E.M. (1969). Seeing, “Seeing”, and Feeling. Review of Metaphysics (23) 3-24.
Zeman, A.Z.J., Della Sala, S., Torrens, L.A., Gountouna, V.-E., McGonigle, D.J., & Logie, R.H. (2010). Loss of Imagery Phenomenology with Intact Visuo-spatial Task Performance: a Case of 'Blind Imagination.' Neuropsychologia (48 #1) 145-155. A very thorough case study, including fMRI brain imaging and extensive cognitive testing, of a patient who has apparently lost his conscious, waking visual imagery (and, at first, his dream imagery) due (presumably) to a very minor stroke that seems otherwise to have had almost no discernible ill effects on his mental (including perceptual) functioning. For other case studies of imagery deficits following brain injury, where other ill effects were relatively mild, see: Brain (1954); Basso et al. (1980); Botez et al. (1985); Goldenberg (1992); Young & van de Wal (1996); and Moro et al. (2008).
Zikmund, V. (1972). Physiological Correlates of Visual Imagery. In P.W. Sheehan (Ed.), The Function and Nature of Imagery (pp. 355-387). New York: Academic Press.
Zimler, J. & Keenan, J.M. (1983). Imagery in the Congenitally Blind: How Visual are Visual Images? Journal of Experimental Psychology: Learning, Memory, and Cognition (9) 269-282. The mnemonic effects of imagery (that are normally assumed to work in sighted subjects via the formation of visual imagery) are also demonstrable with congenitally blind subjects (cf. Jonides, Kahn, & Rozin, 1975; Marmor & Zaback, 1976; Carpenter & Eisenberg, 1978; Kerr, 1983).
Zitlow C.S. (2000). Sounds and Pictures in Words: Images in Literature for Young Adults. Alan Review (27 #2) 20-26. Available online The role of mental imagery in the understanding and appreciation of literary texts. For more on this topic see: Collins (1991), Esrock (1994), Scarry (1995, 1999), Zitlow (2000), Troscianko (2010, 2013, 2014a,b).

Copyright © 2014 by
Nigel J.T. Thomas <njtthomas@yahoo.com>

This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Please note that some links may no longer be functional.
[an error occurred while processing the directive]