Philosophy of Religion

First published Mon Mar 12, 2007; substantive revision Wed Sep 11, 2013

Philosophy of religion is the philosophical examination of the central themes and concepts involved in religious traditions. It involves all the main areas of philosophy: metaphysics, epistemology, logic, ethics and value theory, the philosophy of language, philosophy of science, law, sociology, politics, history, and so on. Philosophy of religion also includes an investigation into the religious significance of historical events (e.g., the Holocaust) and general features of the cosmos (e.g., laws of nature, the emergence of conscious life, widespread testimony of religious significance, and so on). Section one offers an overview of the field and its significance, with subsequent sections covering developments in the field since the mid-twentieth century. These sections will address philosophy of religion as studied primarily in analytic departments of philosophy and religious studies in English speaking countries.

1. The Field and its Significance

The philosophical exploration of religious beliefs and practices is evident in the earliest recorded philosophy, east and west. In the west, throughout Greco-Roman philosophy and the Medieval era, philosophical reflection on God, or gods, reason and faith, the soul, afterlife, and so on were not considered to be a sub-discipline called “philosophy of religion.” The philosophy of God was simply one component among many interwoven philosophical projects. This intermingling of philosophical inquiry with religious themes and the broader enterprises of philosophy (e.g. political theory, epistemology, et al.) is apparent among many early modern philosophers such as Thomas Hobbes, John Locke, and George Berkeley. Only gradually do we find texts devoted exclusively to religious themes. The first use of the term “philosophy of religion” in English occurs in the 17th century work of Ralph Cudworth. Cudworth and his Cambridge University colleague Henry More produced philosophical work with a specific focus on religion and so, if one insisted on dating the beginning of philosophy of religion as a field, there are good reasons for claiming that it began (gradually) in the mid- 17th century (see Taliaferro 2005). Much of the subject matter treated by Cudworth and More is continuous with the current agenda of philosophy of religion (arguments about God's existence, the significance of religious pluralism, the nature of good and evil in relation to God, and so on), and many of the terms that are in current circulation had their origin in Cudworth's and his colleague's work (they coined the terms theism, materialism, consciousness, et al.).

Today philosophy of religion is a robust, intensely active area of philosophy. Almost without exception, any introduction to philosophy text in the Anglophone world includes some philosophy of religion. The importance of philosophy of religion is chiefly due to its subject matter: alternative beliefs about God, Brahman, the sacred, the varieties of religious experience, the interplay between science and religion, the challenge of non-religious philosophies, the nature and scope of good and evil, religious treatments of birth, history, and death, and other substantial terrain. A philosophical exploration of these topics involves fundamental questions about our place in the cosmos and about our relationship to what may transcend the cosmos. Such philosophical work requires an investigation into the nature and limit of human thought. Alongside these complex, ambitious projects, philosophy of religion has at least three factors that contribute to its importance for the overall enterprise of philosophy.

Philosophy of religion addresses embedded social and personal practices. Philosophy of religion is therefore relevant to practical concerns; its subject matter is not all abstract theory. Given the vast percentage of the world population that is either aligned with religion or affected by religion, philosophy of religion has a secure role in addressing people's actual values and commitments. A chief point of reference in much philosophy of religion is the shape and content of living traditions. In this way, philosophy of religion may be informed by the other disciplines that study religious life.

Another reason behind the importance of the field is its breadth. There are few areas of philosophy that are shorn of religious implications. Religious traditions are so comprehensive and all-encompassing in their claims that almost every domain of philosophy may be drawn upon in the philosophical investigation of their coherence, justification, and value.

A third reason is historical. Most philosophers throughout the history of ideas, east and west, have addressed religious topics. One cannot undertake a credible history of philosophy without taking philosophy of religion seriously.

While this field is vital for philosophy, philosophy of religion may also make a pivotal contribution to religious studies and theology. Religious studies often involve important methodological assumptions about history and about the nature and limits of religious experience. These invite philosophical assessment and debate. Theology may also benefit from philosophy of religion in at least two areas. Historically, theology has often drawn upon, or been influenced by, philosophy. Platonism and Aristotelianism have had a major influence on the articulation of classical Christian doctrine, and in the modern era theologians have often drawn on work by philosophers (from Hegel to Heidegger and Derrida). Another benefit lies in philosophy's tasks of clarifying, evaluating, and comparing religious beliefs. The evaluation has at times been highly critical and dismissive, but there are abundant periods in the history of ideas when philosophy has positively contributed to the flourishing of religious life. This constructive interplay is not limited to the west. The role of philosophy in distinctive Buddhist views of knowledge and the self has been of great importance. Just as philosophical ideas have fueled theological work, the great themes of theology involving God's transcendence, the divine attributes, providence, and so on, have made substantial impacts on important philosophical projects. (Hilary Putnam, for example, has linked the philosophy of truth with the concept of a God's-eye point of view.)

At the beginning of the 21st century, a more general rationale for philosophy of religion should be cited: it can enhance cross-cultural dialogue. Philosophers of religion now often seek out common as well as distinguishing features of religious belief and practice. This study can enhance communication between traditions, and between religions and secular institutions.

2. The Meaningfulness of Religious Language

A significant amount of work on the meaningfulness of religious language was carried out in the medieval period, with major contributions made by Maimonides (1135–1204), Thomas Aquinas (1225–1274), Duns Scotus (1266–1308), and William of Ockham (1285–1347). This work built on the even earlier work on religious language by Philo (20 BCE–50 CE), Clement (150–215), and Origen of Alexandria (185–259). In the modern era, the greatest concentration on religious language has taken place in response to logical positivism and to the latter work of Wittgenstein (1889–1951). This section and the next highlights these two more recent movements.

Logical positivism promoted an empiricist principle of meaning which was deemed lethal for religious belief. The following empiricist principle is representative: for a propositional claim (statement) to be meaningful, it must either be about the bare formal relations between ideas such as those enshrined in mathematics and analytic definitions (“A is A,” “triangles are three-sided”) or there must in principle be perceptual experience providing evidence of whether the claim is true or false. (The stronger version of positivism is that claims about the world must be verifiable at least in principle). Both the weaker view (with its more open ended reference to evidence) and the strict view (in principle confirmation) delimit meaningful discourse about the world. Ostensibly factual claims that have no implications for our empirical experience are empty of content. In line with this form of positivism, A. J. Ayer (1910–1989) and others claimed that religious beliefs were meaningless. How might one empirically confirm that God is omnipresent or loving or that Krishna is an avatar of Vishnu? In an important debate in the 1950s and 1960s, philosophical arguments about God were likened to debates about the existence and habits of an unobservable gardener, based on a parable by John Wisdom in 1944–1945. The idea of a gardener who is not just invisible but who also cannot be detected by any sensory faculty seemed nonsense. It seemed like nonsense because they said there was no difference between an imperceptible gardener and no gardener at all. Using this garden analogy and others crafted with the same design, Antony Flew (see his essay in Mitchell 1971) made the case that religious claims do not pass the empirical test of meaning. The field of philosophy of religion in the 1950s and 1960s was largely an intellectual battlefield where the debates centered on whether religious beliefs were meaningful or conceptually absurd.

Empirical verificationism is by no means dead. Some critics of the belief in an incorporeal God continue to advance the same critique as that of Flew and Ayer, albeit with further refinements. Michael Martin and Kai Nielsen are representatives of this approach. And yet despite these efforts, empiricist challenges to the meaningfulness of religious belief are now deemed less impressive than they once were.

In the history of the debate over positivism, the most radical charge was that positivism is self-refuting. The empiricist criterion of meaning itself does not seem to be a statement that expresses the formal relation of ideas, nor does it appear to be empirically verifiable. How might one empirically verify the principle? At best, the principle of verification seems to be a recommendation as to how to describe those statements that positivists are prepared to accept as meaningful. But then, how might a dispute about which other statements are meaningful be settled in a non-arbitrary fashion? To religious believers for whom talk of “Brahman” and “God” is at the center stage of meaningful discourse, the use of the principle of empirical verification will seem arbitrary and question-begging. If the positivist principle is tightened up too far, it seems to threaten various propositions that at least appear to be highly respectable, such as scientific claims about physical processes and events that are not publicly observable. For example, what are we to think of states of the universe prior to all observation of physical strata of the cosmos that cannot be observed directly or indirectly but only inferred as part of an overriding scientific theory? Or what about the mental states of other persons, which may ordinarily be reliably judged, but which, some argue, are under-determined by external, public observation? A person's subjective states—how one feels—can be profoundly elusive to external observers and even to the person him or herself. Can you empirically observe another person's sense of happiness? Arguably, the conscious, subjective states of persons resist airtight verification and the evidence of such states does not meet positivist's standards (van Cleve 1999, Taliaferro 1994). Also worrisome was the wholesale rejection by positivists of ethics as a cognitive, normative practice. The dismissal of ethics as non-cognitive had some embarrassing ad hominum force against an empiricist like Ayer, who regarded ethical claims as lacking any truth value and yet at the same time he construed empirical knowledge in terms of having the right to certain beliefs. Can an ethics of belief be preserved if one dispenses with the normativity of ethics?

The strict empiricist account of meaning was also charged as meaningless on the grounds that there is no coherent, clear, basic level of experience with which to test propositional claims. The experiential “given” is simply too malleable (this has been called “the myth of the given”), often reflecting prior conceptual judgments and, once one appreciates the open-textured character of experience, it may be proposed that virtually any experience can verify or provide some evidence for anything. A mystic might well claim to experience the unity of a timeless spirit everywhere present. Ayer allowed that in principle mystical experience might give meaning to religious terms. Those who concede this appeared to be on a slippery slope leading from empirical verificationism to mystical verificationism (Alston 1991). A growing number of philosophers in the 1960s and 1970s were led to conclude that the empiricist challenge was not decisive. Critical assessments of positivism can be found in work by, among others, Alvin Plantinga, Richard Swinburne, and John Foster.

One of the most sustained lessons from the encounter between positivism and the philosophy of religion is the importance of assessing the meaning of individual beliefs in comprehensive terms. Carl Hempel developed the following critique of positivism, pointing the way to a more comprehensive analysis of the meaning of ostensible propositional claims. Hempel's observations apply with equal force to the philosophy of meaning and science, as well as to the philosophy of religion.

But no matter how one might reasonably delimit the class of sentences qualified to introduce empirically significant terms, this new approach [by the positivists] seems to me to lead to the realization that cognitive significance cannot well be construed as a characteristic of individual sentences, but only of more or less comprehensive systems of sentences (corresponding roughly to scientific theories). A closer study of this point suggests strongly that… the idea of cognitive significance, with its suggestion of a sharp distinction between significant and non-significant sentences or systems of such, has lost its promise and fertility… and that it had better be replaced by certain concepts which admit of differences in degree, such as the formal simplicity of a system; its explanatory and predictive power; and its degree of conformation relative to the available evidence. The analysis and theoretical reconstruction of these concepts seems to offer the most promising way of advancing further the clarification of the issues implicit in the idea of cognitive significance. (Hempel 1959, 129)

If Hempel is right, the project initiated by Ayer had to be qualified, taking into account larger theoretical frameworks. Religious claims could not be ruled out at the start but should be allowed a hearing with competing views of cognitive significance. Ronald Hepburn summarizes a widely held conviction that complements Hempel's position: “There can be no short-cut in the philosophy of religion past the painstaking examination and re-examination of problems in the entire field… . No single, decisive verification-test, no solemn Declaration of Meaninglessness, can relieve us of the labor” (Hepburn 1963, 50). Ayer himself later conceded that the positivist account of meaning was unsatisfactory (Ayer 1973).

With the retreat of positivism in the 1970s, philosophers of religion re-introduced concepts of God, competing views of the sacred, and the like, which were backed by arguments that appealed not to narrow scientific confirmation but to broad considerations of coherence, breadth of explanation, simplicity, religious experience, and other factors. But before turning to this material, it is important to consider a debate within philosophy of religion that was largely inspired by the Austrian philosopher Ludwig Wittgenstein.

3. Religious Forms of Life and Practices

Wittgenstein launched an attack on what has been called the picture theory of meaning, according to which statements may be judged true or false depending upon whether reality matches the picture represented by the belief. This understanding of truth and beliefs—which is similar to the correspondence theory of truth in which the statement “God exists” is true if and only if God exists—seemed to Wittgenstein to be misguided. It gives rise to insoluble philosophical problems and it misses the whole point of having religious beliefs, which is that the meaning is to be found in the life in which they are employed. By shifting attention away from the referential meaning of words to their use, Wittgenstein promoted the idea that we should attend to what he called forms of life. As this move was applied to religious matters, a number of philosophers either denied or at least played down the extent to which religious forms of life involve metaphysical claims. Norman Malcolm, B. R. Tilghman, and D. Z. Phillips have all promoted this approach to religion. It may be considered non-realist in the sense that it does not treat religious beliefs as straightforward metaphysical claims that can be adjudicated philosophically as either true or false concerning an objective reality. By their lights, the traditional metaphysics of theism got what it deserved when it came under attack in the mid-twentieth century by positivists.

This Wittgensteinian challenge, then, appears to place in check much of the way philosophers in the west have approached religion. When, for example, Descartes, Locke, Leibniz, Berkeley, and Hume argued for and against the justification of belief in God, metaphysics was at the forefront. They were interested in the best possible arguments for and against God's existence. The same preoccupation with the truth or falsehood of religious belief is also central to ancient and medieval philosophical reflection about the Divine. When Aristotle and Thomas Aquinas articulated arguments for God's existence they were engaged in full-fledged metaphysics.

At least two reasons may support recent non-realism. First, it has some credibility based on the sociology of religion. In the practice of religion it appears that we have something more (one might well say something deeper) than “mere” metaphysical theorizing. Religion seems pre-eminently to be focused upon how we live. Phillips has examined different religious practices such as prayer and the belief in an afterlife, concluding that both are intelligible because the motives behind each can be held intact without any of the metaphysical “baggage” traditionally linked with them. For example, prayer to God by parents for the recovery of a child's health may be understood as an expression of their anguish and an effort to center their hope on the child's getting better, and not as an attempt to persuade God to violate the laws of nature by miraculously healing their child.

A second reason that might be offered is that the classical and contemporary arguments for specific views of God have seemed unsuccessful to many philosophers (though not to all, as observed in section 4.2, below). Tilghman takes this line and argues that if the traditional arguments for God's existence are re-interpreted as part of religious life and not treated as if they were adjudicating metaphysical truth-claims, then they have an intelligibility and force that they otherwise lack.

Non-realist views have their critics from the vantage point both of atheists such as Michael Martin and theists such as Roger Trigg. By way of a preliminary response it may be pointed out that even if a non-realist approach is adopted this would not mean altogether jettisoning the more traditional approach to religious beliefs. If one of the reasons advanced on behalf of non-realism is that the traditional project fails, then ongoing philosophy of religion will still require investigating to determine whether in fact the tradition does fail. As John Dewey once observed, philosophical ideas not only never die, they never fade away.

A more substantial reply to Wittgensteinian non-realism has been the charge that it does not preserve but instead undermines the very intelligibility of religious practice. Let us concede that religious practice is antecedent to philosophical theories that justify the practice—a concession not shared by all. Even so, if one engages in a religious practice, such as prayer to God or Buddhist meditation to see through the illusion of having a substantial, enduring ego, the development of some sort of philosophical theory to make sense of this practice seems inevitable. Once such a theory is in place (and historically there have been no lack of these theories), it makes sense to raise the question of its truth. While Malcolm has proposed that it makes sense to believe in God without believing that God exists, others have submitted that lack of belief that God exists makes belief in God meaningless. Belief that X is prior to belief in X. One may hope that something will occur (a child recovers from illness) without the accompanying belief that it will occur, but it is more puzzling to suppose that one can trust a Divine being without believing or hoping there is some Divine reality there to rely upon.

While non-realism might seem to lay the groundwork for greater tolerance between religions (and between religions and the secular world) because it subverts the battle over which religion has a true picture of the cosmos, critics have lamented the loss of a normative way of choosing between religions, ways that seem to be used in commonplace philosophical reflection on the merits of religion. So, today it is still not at all unusual for people to claim they have changed religions (or stayed with their own or abandoned all religion or converted to a religion), for reasons like the appeal to religious experience, answered or unanswered prayer, miracles or the lack of them, moral and cultural relativism, an overwhelming sense of the reality of good and evil, and so on.

Although realists and non-realists are at odds in debate, each side can learn from the other. Non-realists can consider the realist approach to divine attributes and a philosophy of God as reflections of a religious form of life. And a realist philosophical treatment of God's goodness may reveal important insights about practical religious forms of life. On the other hand, the non-realist approach to religion may offer a fitting caution to realists about approaching religion as a mere theoretical, abstract enterprise. Imagining a middle ground is not easy, however. D. Z. Phillips writes:

To ask whether God exists is not to ask a theoretical question. If it is to mean anything at all, it is to wonder about praising and praying; it is to wonder whether there is anything in all that. This is why philosophy cannot answer the question “Does God exist?” with either an affirmative or a negative reply … . “There is a God”, though it appears to be in the indicative mood, is an expression of faith (Phillips 1976, 181).

To successfully secure a position somewhere in between extreme non-realism and realism, one would need to see the intelligibility of asking both theoretical questions such as “Is there a God?” as well as searching out the meaningful practices of faith, praise, and prayer. Near the end of his life, D.Z. Phillips' own train of thought seemed to land him solidly in Feuerbachian atheism (and thus Phillips concluded his work as a solid realist):

In “God is love,” is the “is” one of predication as in “Tony Blair is prime minister”? In the latter case, I can refer to Tony Blair without knowing that fact…But when I say “God is love,” or “God is gracious,” what is the “it” to which the love or grace are attributed? There is none. That is “the metaphysical subject” which, as Feuerbach says, is an illusion (Phillips 2004, 155).

A better example of someone who was a realist but took religious forms of life as a central reference point is John Clayton (see especially his Religions, Reasons and Gods: Essays in Cross-Cultural Philosophy of Religion).

4. The Concept of God

4.1 Philosophical Reflection on Divine Attributes

Most philosophy of religion in the west has focused on different versions of theism. Ancient philosophy of religion wrestled with the credibility of monotheism and polytheism in opposition to skepticism and very primitive naturalistic schemes. For example, Plato argued that the view that God is singularly good should be preferred to the portrait of the gods that was articulated in Greek poetic tradition, according to which there are many gods, often imperfect and subject to vice and ignorance. The emergence and development of Judaism, Christianity, and Islam on a global scale secured the centrality of theism for philosophical enquiry, but the relevance of a philosophical exploration of theism is not limited to those interested in these religions and the cultures in which they flourish. While theism has generally flourished in religious traditions amid religious practices, one may be a theist without adopting any religion whatever, and one may find theistic elements (however piecemeal) in Confucianism, Hinduism, some versions of Mahayana Buddhism, as well as in the religions of some smaller scale societies. The debate over theism also has currency for secular humanism and religious forms of atheism as in Theravada Buddhist philosophy. Consider first the philosophical project of articulating theism and then the philosophy of divine attributes.

Terms applied both to God and to any aspect of the world have been classified as either univocal (sharing the same sense), equivocal (used in different senses), or analogical. There is a range of accounts of analogous predication, but the most common—and the one assumed here—is that terms are used analogously when their use in different cases (John limps and the argument limps) is based on what is believed to be a resemblance. It seems clear that many terms used to describe God in theistic traditions are used analogously, as when God is referred to as a father, shepherd, or fountain. More difficult to classify are descriptions of God as good, personal, knowing, omnipresent, and creative. Heated philosophical and theological disputes centre on unpacking the meaning of such descriptions, disputes that are often carried out with the use of thought experiments.

In thought experiments, hypothetical cases are described—cases that may or may not represent the way things are. In these descriptions, terms normally used in one context are employed in expanded settings. Thus, in thinking of God as omniscient, one might begin with a non-controversial case of a person knowing that a proposition is true, taking note of what it means for someone to possess that knowledge and of the ways in which the knowledge is secured. A theistic thought experiment would seek to extend our understanding of knowledge as we think of it in our own case, working toward the conception of a maximum or supreme intellectual excellence befitting the religious believers' understanding of God. Various degrees of refinement would then be in order, as one speculates not only about the extent of a maximum set of propositions known but also about how these might be known. That is, in attributing omniscience to God, would one thereby claim God knows all truths in a way that is analogous to the way we come to know truths about the world? Too close an analogy would produce a peculiar picture of God relying upon, for example, induction, sensory evidence, or the testimony of others. One move in the philosophy of God has been to assert that the claim “God knows something” employs the word “knows” univocally when read as picking out the thesis that God knows something, while it uses the term in only a remotely analogical sense if read as identifying how God knows (Swinburne 1977).

Here a medieval distinction comes into play between the res significata (what is asserted—for instance, that God knows X) and modus significandi (the mode or manner in which what is signified is realized or brought about—for instance, how God knows X). We might have a good grasp of what is meant by the claim that a being is omniscient while having little idea of how a being might be so. Thought experiments aimed at giving some sense to the Divine attribute of omniscience have been advanced by drawing attention to the way we know some things immediately (bodily positions, feelings and intentions), and then by extending this, coaxing us into conceiving a being that knows all things about itself and the cosmos immediately (see Beaty 1991 and Zagzebski 2008 for a constructive view, and Blumenfeld in Morris (ed.) 1987 for criticism).

Utilizing thought experiments and language in this way, philosophical theology has a stake in the soundness and richness of the imagination, picturing the way things might be “in one's mind's eye,” whether or not this relies on any actual imagery. Philosophers are now more cautious about drawing such inferences as we are increasingly aware of how some features of an imagined state of affairs might be misconceived or overlooked. Even so, it has been argued that if a state of affairs appears to one to be possible after careful reflection, checking it against one's background knowledge in other areas, then there is at least some warrant in judging the state of affairs to be a bona fide possibility (Sorensen 1992; see also Taliaferro 2002 and Gendler and Hawthorne 2002).

Work on the divine attributes has been vast. To generate a portrait of the literature on divine attributes, consider the issues that arise in reflection on omniscience, eternity, and goodness.

4.1.1 Omniscience

Imagine there is a God who knows the future free action of human beings. If God does know you will freely do some act X, then it is true that you will indeed do X. But if you are free, would you not be free to avoid doing X? Given that it is foreknown you will do X, it appears you would not be free to refrain from the act.

Initially this paradox seems easy to dispel. If God knows about your free action, then God knows that you will freely do something and that you could have refrained from it. God's foreknowing the act does not make it necessary. Does not the paradox only arise because we confuse the proposition, “Necessarily, if God knows X, then X” with “If God knows X, then necessarily X”? After all, it is necessarily the case that if I know you are reading this entry right now, then it follows that you are reading this entry, but your reading this entry may still be seen as a contingent state of affairs. But the problem is not so easily diffused, however, because if God does infallibly know that some state of affairs obtains then it cannot be that the state of affairs does not obtain. Think of what is sometimes called the necessity of the past. Once a state of affairs has obtained, it is unalterably or necessarily the case that it did occur. If the future is known precisely and comprehensively, isn't the future like the past, necessarily or unalterably the case? If the problem is put in first-person terms and one imagines God foreknows you will freely turn to a different entry in this Encyclopedia (moreover, God knows with unsurpassable precision when you will do so, which entry you will select and what you will think about it), then an easy resolution of the paradox seems elusive. To highlight the nature of this problem imagine God tells you what you will freely do in the next hour. Under such conditions, is it still intelligible to believe you have the ability to do otherwise if it is known by God as well as yourself what you will indeed elect to do? Self-foreknowledge, then, produces an additional related problem because the psychology of choice seems to require prior ignorance about what we will choose.

Various replies to the freedom-foreknowledge debate have been given. Some adopt compatibilism, affirming the compatibility of free will and determinism, and conclude that foreknowledge is no more threatening to freedom than determinism. While some prominent philosophical theists in the past have taken this route (most dramatically Jonathan Edwards in the eighteenth century), this seems to be the minority position in philosophy of religion today (exceptions include Paul Helm and Lynne Baker). A second position adheres to the libertarian outlook, which insists that freedom involves a radical, indeterminist exercise of power, and concludes that God cannot know future free action. What prevents such philosophers from denying that God is omniscient is that they contend there are no truths about future free actions, or that while there are truths about the future, God freely decides not to know them in order to preserve free choice. On the first view, prior to someone's doing a free action, there is no fact of the matter that he or she will do a given act. This is in keeping with a traditional, but controversial, interpretation of Aristotle's philosophy of time and truth. Aristotle may have thought it was neither true nor false prior to a given sea battle whether a given side would win it. Some theists, such as Richard Swinburne, adopt this line today, holding that the future cannot be known. If it cannot be known for metaphysical reasons, then omniscience can be analyzed as knowing all that it is possible to know. That God cannot know future free action is no more of a mark against God's being omniscient than God's inability to make square circles is a mark against God's being omnipotent. Other philosophers deny the original paradox. They insist that God's foreknowledge is compatible with libertarian freedom and seek to resolve the quandary by claiming that God is not bound in time (God does not so much foreknow the future as God knows what for us is the future from an eternal viewpoint) and by arguing that the unique vantage point of an omniscient God prevents any impingement on freedom. God can simply know the future without this having to be grounded on an established, determinate future. But this only works if there is no necessity of eternity analogous to the necessity of the past. Why think that we have any more control over God's timeless belief than over God's past belief? If not, then there is an exactly parallel dilemma of timeless knowledge. For outstanding current analysis of freedom and foreknowledge, see the work of Linda Zagzebski.

4.1.2 Eternity

Could there be a being that is outside time? In the great monotheistic traditions, God is thought of as without any kind of beginning or end. God will never, indeed, can never, cease to be. Some philosophical theists hold that God's temporality is very much like ours in the sense that there is a before, during, and an after for God, or a past, present, and future for God. This view is sometimes referred to as the thesis that God is everlasting. Those adopting a more radical stance claim that God is independent of temporality, arguing either that God is not in time at all, or that God is “simultaneously” at or in all times. This is sometimes called the view that God is eternal as opposed to everlasting.

Why adopt the more radical stance? One reason, already noted, is that if God is not temporally bound, there may be a resolution to the earlier problem of reconciling freedom and foreknowledge. As Augustine put it: “For He does not pass from this to that by transition of thought, but beholds all things with absolute unchangeableness; so that of those things which emerge in time, the future, indeed, are not yet, and the present are now, and the past no longer are; but all of these are by Him comprehended in His stable and eternal presence” (The City of God, 1972, XI, 21). If God is outside time, there may also be a secure foundation explaining God's immutability (changelessness), incorruptibility, and immortality. Furthermore, there may be an opportunity to use God's standing outside of time to launch an argument that God is the creator of time.

Those affirming God to be unbounded by temporal sequences face several puzzles which I note without trying to settle. If God is somehow at or in all times, is God simultaneously at or in each? If so, there is the following problem. If God is simultaneous with the event of Rome burning in 410, and also simultaneous with your reading this entry, then it seems that Rome must be burning at the same time you are reading this entry. (This problem was advanced by Nelson Pike; Stump and Kretzmann have replied that the simultaneity involved in God's eternal knowledge is not transitive). A different problem arises with respect to eternity and omniscience. If God is outside of time, can God know what time it is now? Arguably, there is a fact of the matter that it is now, say, midnight on 1 July 2010. A God outside of time might know that at midnight on 1 July 2010 certain things occur, but could God know when it is now that time? The problem is that the more emphasis we place on the claim that God's supreme existence is independent of time, the more we seem to jeopardize taking seriously time as we know it. Finally, while the great monotheistic traditions provide a portrait of the Divine as supremely different from the creation, there is also an insistence on God's proximity or immanence. For some theists, describing God as a person or person-like (God loves, acts, knows) is not to equivocate. But it is not clear that an eternal God could be personal. For recent work on God's relation to time, see work by Katherin Rogers (Rogers 2007, 2008).

4.1.3 The goodness of God

All known world religions address the nature of good and evil and commend ways of achieving human well-being, whether this be thought of in terms of salvation, liberation, deliverance, enlightenment, tranquility, or an egoless state of Nirvana. Notwithstanding important differences, there is a substantial overlap between many of these conceptions of the good as witnessed by the commending of the Golden Rule (“Do unto others as you would have them do unto you”) in many religions. Some religions construe the Divine as in some respect beyond our human notions of good and evil. In some forms of Hinduism, for example, Brahman has been extolled as possessing a sort of moral transcendence, and some Christian theologians and philosophers have likewise insisted that God is only a moral agent in a highly qualified sense, if at all (Davies 1993). To call God good is, for them, very different from calling a human being good.

Here I note only some of the ways in which philosophers have articulated what it means to call God good. In treating the matter, there has been a tendency either to explain God's goodness in terms of standards that are not God's creation and thus, in some measure, independent of God's will, or in terms of God's will and the standards God has created. The latter view has been termed theistic voluntarism. A common version of theistic voluntarism is the claim that for something to be good or right simply means that it is willed by God and for something to be evil or wrong means that it is forbidden by God.

Theistic voluntarists face several difficulties: moral language seems intelligible without having to be explained in terms of the Divine will. Indeed, many people make what they take to be objective moral judgments without making any reference to God. If they are using moral language intelligibly, how could it be that the very meaning of such moral language should be analyzed in terms of Divine volitions? New work in the philosophy of language may be of use to theistic voluntarists. According to a causal theory of reference, “water” necessarily designates H2O. It is not a contingent fact that water is H2O notwithstanding the fact that many people can use the term “water” without knowing its composition. Similarly, could it not be the case that “good” may refer to that which is willed by God even though many people are not aware of (or even deny) the existence of God? Another difficulty for voluntarism lies in accounting for the apparent meaningful content of claims like “God is good.” It appears that in calling God “good” the religious believer is saying more than “God wills what God wills.” If so, must not the very notion of goodness have some meaning independent of God's will? Also at issue is the worry that if voluntarism is accepted, the theist has threatened the normative objectivity of moral judgments. Could God make it the case that moral judgments were turned upside down? For example, could God make cruelty good? Arguably, the moral universe is not so malleable. In reply, some voluntarists have sought to understand the stability of the moral laws in light of God's immutably fixed, necessary nature.

By understanding God's goodness in terms of God's being (as opposed to God's will alone), we come close to the non-voluntarist stand. Aquinas and others hold that God is essentially good in virtue of God's very being. All such positions are non-voluntarist in so far as they do not claim that what it means for something to be good is that God wills it to be so. The goodness of God may be articulated in various ways, either by arguing that God's perfection requires God being good as an agent or by arguing that God's goodness can be articulated in terms of other Divine attributes such as those outlined above. For example, because knowledge is in itself good, omniscience is a supreme good. God has also been considered good in so far as God has created and conserves in existence a good cosmos. Debates over the problem of evil (if God is indeed omnipotent and perfectly good, why is there evil?) have poignancy precisely because they challenge this chief judgment over God's goodness. (The debate over the problem of evil is taken up in section 4.2.)

The choice between voluntarism and seeing God's very being as good is rarely strict. Some theists who oppose a full-scale voluntarism allow for partial voluntarist elements. According to one such moderate stance, while God cannot make cruelty good, God can make some actions morally required or morally forbidden which otherwise would be morally neutral. Arguments for this have been based on the thesis that the cosmos and all its contents are God's creation. According to some theories of property, an agent making something good gains entitlements over the property. The crucial moves in arguments that the cosmos and its contents belong to their Creator have been to guard against the idea that human parents would then “own” their children (they do not, because parents are not radical creators like God), and the idea that Divine ownership would permit anything, thus construing our duties owed to God as the duties of a slave to a master (a view to which not all theists have objected). Theories spelling out why and how the cosmos belongs to God have been prominent in all three monotheistic traditions. Plato defended the notion, as did Aquinas and Locke. (See Brody 1974 for a defense.)

A new development in theorizing about God's goodness has been advanced in Zagzebski 2004. Zagzebski contends that being an exemplary virtuous person consists in having good motives. Motives have an internal, affective or emotive structure. An emotion is “an affective perception of the world” (Zagzebski 2004, xvi) that “initiates and directs action” (Ibid., 1). The ultimate grounding of what makes human motives good is if they are in accord with the motives of God. Zagzebski's theory is perhaps the most ambitious virtue theory in print, offering an account of human virtues of God. Not all theists resonate with her bold claim that God is a person who has emotions, but many allow that (at least in some analogical sense) God may be see as personal and having affective states.

One other effort worth noting to link judgments of good and evil with judgments about God relies upon the ideal observer theory of ethics. According to this theory, moral judgments can be analyzed in terms of how an ideal observer would judge matters. To say an act is right entails a commitment to holding that if there were an ideal observer, it would approve of the act; to claim an act is wrong entails the thesis that if there were an ideal observer, it would disapprove of it. The theory can be found in works by Hume, Adam Smith, and Hare and Firth (1970). The ideal observer is variously described, but typically is thought of as an impartial omniscient regarding non-moral facts (facts that can be grasped without already knowing the moral status or implications of the fact—for instance, “He did something bad” is a moral fact; “He hit Smith” is not), and as omnipercipient (Firth's term for adopting a position of universal affective appreciation of the points of view of all involved parties). The theory receives some support from the fact that most moral disputes can be analyzed in terms of different parties challenging each other to be impartial, to get their empirical facts straight, and to be more sensitive—for example, by realizing what it feels like to be disadvantaged. The theory has formidable critics and defenders. If true, it does not follow that there is an ideal observer, but if it is true and moral judgments are coherent, then the idea of an ideal observer is coherent. Given certain conceptions of God in the three great monotheistic traditions, God fits the ideal observer description (and more besides, of course). Should an ideal observer theory be cogent, a theist would have some reason for claiming that atheists committed to normative, ethical judgments are also committed to the idea of a God or a God-like being. (For a defense of a theistic form of the ideal observer theory, see Taliaferro 2005; for criticism see Anderson, 2005.)

4.2 God's Existence

In some introductory philosophy textbooks and anthologies, the arguments for God's existence are presented as ostensible proofs which are then shown to be fallible. For example, an argument from the apparent order and purposive nature of the cosmos will be criticized on the grounds that, at best, the argument would establish there is a purposive, designing intelligence at work in the cosmos. This falls far short of establishing that there is a God who is omnipotent, omniscient, benevolent, and so on. But two comments need to be made: First, that “meager” conclusion alone would be enough to disturb a scientific naturalist who wishes to rule out all such transcendent intelligence. Second, few philosophers today advance a single argument as a proof. Customarily, a design argument might be advanced alongside an argument from religious experience, and the other arguments to be considered below. True to Hempel's advice (cited earlier) about comprehensive inquiry, it is increasingly common to see philosophies—scientific naturalism or theism—advanced with cumulative arguments, a whole range of considerations, and not with a supposed knock-down, single proof.

One reason why the case for and against major, comprehensive philosophies are mostly cumulative is because of discontent in what is often called foundationalism. In one classical form of foundationalism, one secures first and foremost a basis of beliefs which one may see to be true with certainty. The base may be cast as indubitable or infallible. One then slowly builds up the justification for one's other, more extensive beliefs about oneself and the world. Many (but not all) philosophers now see justification as more complex and interwoven; the proper object of philosophical inquiry is overall coherence, not a series of distinguishable building operations beginning with a foundation.

One way of carrying out philosophy of religion along non-foundationalist lines has been to build a case for the comparative rationality of a religious view of the world. It has been argued that the intellectual integrity of a religious world view can be secured if it can be shown to be no less rational than the available alternatives. It need only achieve intellectual parity. John Hick and others emphasize the integrity of religious ways of seeing the world that are holistic, internally coherent, and open to criticism along various external lines (see Hick 2004, 2006). On the latter front, if a religious way of conceiving the world is at complete odds with contemporary science, that would count as grounds for revising the religious outlook. The case for religion need not, however, be scientific or even analogous to science. If Hick is right, religious ways of seeing the world are not incompatible with science, but complementary. Independent of Hick but in the same spirit, Plantinga has proposed that belief in God's existence may be taken as properly basic and fully warranted without having to be justified in relation to standard arguments for God from design, miracles, and so on. Plantinga argues that the tendency to believe in God follows natural tendencies of the human mind. This stance comprises what is commonly referred to as Reformed Epistemology because of its connection to the work of the Reformed theologian John Calvin (1509–1564) who maintained that we have a sense of God (sensus divinitatis) leading us to see God in the world around us. Plantinga has thereby couched the question of justification within the larger arena of metaphysics. By advancing an intricate, comprehensive picture of how beliefs can be warranted when they function as God designed them, he has provided what some believe to be a combined metaphysical and epistemic case for the rationality of religious convictions (see Beilby (ed.) 2002).

Who has the burden of proof in a debate between a theist and an atheist? Antony Flew (1984) thinks it is the theist. By his lights, the theist and atheist can agree on a whole base line of truths (such as the findings of the physical sciences). The question then becomes, Why go any further? Flew wields a version of Ockham's razor, arguing that if one has no reason to go further, one has reason not to go further. (As it happens, Flew has subsequently claimed that there are good reasons for going beyond the natural world, and he is currently a theist; see Flew 2008.) His challenge has been met on various fronts, with some critics claiming that Flew's burden of proof argument is wedded to an outmoded foundationalism, that any burden of proof is shared equally by atheists and theists, or that the theist has an array of arguments to help shoulder a greater burden of proof. The position of fideism is a further option. Fideism is the view that religious belief does not require evidence and that religious faith is self-vindicating. Karl Barth (1886–1968) advocated a fideistic philosophy. (For a critical assessment of fideism, see Moser 2010, chapter 2.) Hick and Plantinga need not be considered fideists because of the high role each gives to experience, coherence, and reflection.

Table 1 lists some key theistic arguments, along with some of the leading advocates.

Ontological S.T. Davis, D. Dombrowski, C. Dore, E.J. Lowe, N. Malcolm, A. Plantinga, J. Ross, W. Rowe, R. Swinburne, R. Taylor
Cosmological W. Craig, S.T. Davis, R. Gale, R. Koons, H. Meynell, B. Miller, R. Purtill, T. O'Connor, A. Pruss, W. Rowe (partial advocate)
Design D. and R. Basinger, R. Collins, W. Craig, S.T. Davis, J. Foster, R.A. Larmer, R. Swinburne
Miracles W. Craig, P. Dietl, J. Earman, D. Geivett, R. Swinburne
Values—Moral Experience P. Copan, C.S. Evans, A.C. Ewing, M. Linville, G. Mavrodes, H.P. Owen, M. Wynn
Argument from Consciousness R.M. Adams, J.P. Moreland, M. Rea, R. Swinburne
Religious Experience W. Alston, C. Frank, J. Gellman, G. Gutting, K.M. Kwan, R. Swinburne, W. Wainwright, K. Yandell
Cognition R. Creel, A. Plantinga, R. Taylor
Wager Arguments J. Jodan, N. Rescher, G. Schlesinger, T.V. Morris

Table 1. Theistic Arguments

To sketch some of the main lines of argument in this literature, consider the ontological, cosmological, and teleological arguments, arguments from the problem of evil, and the argument over the cognitive status of religious experience.

4.2.1 Ontological arguments

There is a host of arguments under this title; all of them are based principally on conceptual, a priori grounds which do not involve a posteriori empirical investigation. If a version of the argument works, then it can be deployed using only the concept of God and some modal principles of inference, that is, principles concerning possibility and necessity. The argument need not resist all empirical support, however, as I shall indicate.

The focus of the argument is the thesis that, if there is a God, then God's existence is necessary. God's existence is not contingent—God is not the sort of being that just happens to exist. That this is a plausible picture of what is meant by God may be shown by appealing to the way God is conceived in Jewish, Christian, and Islamic traditions. This would involve some a posteriori, empirical research into the way God is thought of in these traditions. Alternatively, a defender of the ontological argument might hope to convince others that the concept of God is the concept of a being that exists necessarily by beginning with the idea of a maximally excellent being. If there were a maximally excellent being what would it be like? It has been argued that among its array of great-making qualities (omniscience and omnipotence) would be necessary existence. Once fully articulated, it can be argued that a maximally excellent being which existed necessarily could be called “God.”

The ontological argument goes back to St. Anselm (1033/34–1109), but I shall explore a current version relying heavily on the principle that if something is possibly necessarily the case, then it is necessarily the case (or, to put it redundantly, it is necessarily necessary). The principle can be illustrated in the case of propositions. That six is the smallest perfect number (that number which is equal to the sum of its divisors including one but not including itself) does not seem to be the sort of thing that might just happen to be true. Rather, either it is necessarily true or necessarily false. If the latter, it is not possible, if the former, it is possible. If one knows that it is possible that six is the smallest perfect number then one has good reason to believe that. Do we have reason to think it is possible that God exists necessarily? In support of this, one can also appeal to a posteriori matters, noting the extant religious traditions that uphold such a notion. The fact that the concept of God as a necessarily existing reality seems to be coherently conceived widely across time and cultures is some evidence that the concept is coherent (it is possible there is a God), for God's existence has plausibility, thus can also contribute to believing it is possible God exists. There is an old philosophical precept that from the fact that something exists, it follows that it is possible (ab esse ad posse valet consequentia). A related principle is that evidence that something exists is evidence that it is possible that such a thing exists. There does not appear to be anything amiss in their thinking of God as necessarily existing; if the belief that God exists is incoherent this is not obvious. Indeed, a number of atheists think God might exist, but conclude God does not. If we are successful in establishing the possibility that God necessarily exists, the conclusion follows that it is necessarily the case that God exists.

There have been hundreds of objections and replies to this argument. Perhaps the most ambitious objection is that the argument can be used with one minor alteration to argue that God cannot exist. Assume all the argument above is correct, but also that it is possible that God does not exist. Atheists can point out that many theists who believe there is a God at least allow for the bare possibility that they could be wrong and there is no God. If it is possible that there is no God, then it would necessarily follow that there is no God. Replies to this objection emphasize the difficulty of conceiving of the non-existence of God. The battle over whether God is necessary or impossible is often fought over the coherence of the various divine attributes discussed in section 3. If you think these attributes are compossible, involve no contradictions, and violate no known metaphysical truths, then you may well have good grounds for concluding that God is possible and therefore necessary. However, if you see a contradiction, say, in describing a being who is at once omniscient and omnipotent, you may well have good grounds for concluding that God's existence is impossible.

Another objection is that it makes no sense to think of a being existing necessarily; propositions may be necessarily true or false, but objects cannot be necessary or contingent. Some philosophers reply that it makes no less sense to think of an individual (God) existing necessarily than it does to think of propositions being necessarily true.

A further objection is that the ontological argument cannot get off the ground because of the question-begging nature of its premise that if there is a God, then God exists necessarily. Does admitting this premise concede that there is some individual thing such that if it exists, it exists necessarily? Replies have claimed that the argument only requires one to consider an ostensible state of affairs, without having to concede initially whether the state of affairs is possible or impossible. To consider what is involved in positing the existence of God is no more hazardous than considering what is involved in positing the existence of unicorns. One can entertain the existence of unicorns and their necessary features (that necessarily if there were unicorns, there would exist single-horned beasts) without believing that there are unicorns.

Finally, consider the objection that, if successful in providing reasons to believe that God exists, the ontological argument could be used to establish the existence of a whole array of other items, like perfect islands. Replies to this sort of objection have typically questioned whether it makes sense to think of an island (a physical thing) as existing necessarily or as having maximal excellence on a par with God. Does the imagined island have excellences like omniscience, omnipotence (a power which would include the power to make indefinitely many islands), and so on?

Classical, alternative versions of the ontological argument are propounded by Anselm, Spinoza, and Descartes, with current versions by Alvin Plantinga, Charles Hartshorne, Norman Malcolm, and C. Dore; classical critics include Gaunilo and Kant, and current critics are many, including William Rowe, J. Barnes, G. Oppy, and J. L. Mackie. The latest book-length treatment of the ontological argument is a vigorous defense: Rethinking the Ontological Argument by Daniel Dombrowski (2006).

4.2.2 Cosmological arguments

Arguments in this vein are more firmly planted in empirical, a posteriori reflection, but some versions employ a priori reasons as well. There are various versions. Some argue that the cosmos had an initial cause outside it, a First Cause in time. Others argue that the cosmos has a necessary, sustaining cause from instant to instant. The two versions are not mutually exclusive, for it is possible both that the cosmos had a First Cause and that it currently has a sustaining cause.

The cosmological argument relies on the intelligibility of the notion of something which is not itself caused to exist by anything else. This could be either the all-out necessity of supreme pre-eminence across all possible worlds used in versions of the ontological argument, or a more local, limited notion of a being that is uncaused in the actual world. If successful, the argument would provide reason for thinking there is at least one such being of extraordinary power responsible for the existence of the cosmos. At best, it may not justify a full picture of the God of religion (a First Cause would be powerful, but not necessarily omnipotent), but it would nonetheless challenge naturalistic alternatives and bring one closer to theism.

Both versions of the argument ask us to consider the cosmos in its present state. Is the world as we know it something that necessarily exists? At least with respect to ourselves, the planet, the solar system and the galaxy, it appears not. With respect to these items in the cosmos, it makes sense to ask why they exist rather than not. In relation to scientific accounts of the natural world, such enquiries into causes make abundant sense and are perhaps even essential presuppositions of the natural sciences. Some proponents of the argument contend that we know a priori that if something exists there is a reason for its existence. So, why does the cosmos exist? If we explain the contingent existence of the cosmos (or states of the cosmos) only in terms of other contingent things (earlier states of the cosmos, say), then a full cosmic explanation will never be attained. At this point the two versions of the argument divide.

Arguments to a First Cause in time contend that a continuous temporal regress from one contingent existence to another would never account for the existence of the cosmos, and they conclude that it is more reasonable to accept there was a First Cause than to accept either a regress or the claim that the cosmos just came into being from nothing. Arguments to a sustaining cause of the cosmos claim that explanations of why something exists now cannot be adequate without assuming a present, contemporaneous sustaining cause. The arguments have been based on the denial of all actual infinities or on the acceptance of some infinities (for instance, the coherence of supposing there to be infinitely many stars) combined with the rejection of an infinite regress of explanations solely involving contingent states of affairs. The latter has been described as a vicious regress as opposed to one that is benign. There are plausible examples of vicious infinite regresses that do not generate explanations: for instance, imagine that I explain my possession of a book by reporting that I got it from A who got it from B, and so on to infinity. This would not explain how I got the book. Alternatively, imagine a mirror with light reflected in it. Would the presence of light be successfully explained if one claimed that the light was a reflection of light from another mirror, and the light in that mirror came from yet another mirror, and so on to infinity? Consider a final case. You come across a word you do not understand; let it be “ongggt”. You ask its meaning and are given another word which is unintelligible to you, and so on, forming an infinite regress. Would you ever know the meaning of the first term? The force of these cases is to show how similar they are to the regress of contingent explanations.

Versions of the argument that reject all actual infinities face the embarrassment of explaining what is to be made of the First Cause, especially since it might have some features that are actually infinite. In reply, Craig and others have contended that they have no objection to potential infinities (although the First Cause will never cease to be, it will never become an actual infinity). They further accept that prior to the creation, the First Cause was not in time, a position relying on the theory that time is relational rather than absolute. The current scientific popularity of the relational view may offer support to defenders of the argument.

It has been objected that both versions of the cosmological argument set out an inflated picture of what explanations are reasonable. Why should the cosmos as a whole need an explanation? If everything in the cosmos can be explained, albeit through infinite, regressive accounts, what is left to explain? One may reply either by denying that infinite regresses actually do satisfactorily explain, or by charging that the failure to seek an explanation for the whole is arbitrary. The question, “Why is there a cosmos?” seems a perfectly intelligible one. If there are accounts for things in the cosmos, why not for the whole? The argument is not built on the fallacy of treating every whole as having all the properties of its parts. But if everything in the cosmos is contingent, it seems just as reasonable to believe that the whole cosmos is contingent as it is to believe that if everything in the cosmos were invisible, the cosmos as a whole would be invisible.

Another objection is that rather than explaining the contingent cosmos, the cosmological argument introduces a mysterious entity of which we can make very little philosophical or scientific sense. How can positing at least one First Cause provide a better account of the cosmos than simply concluding that the cosmos lacks an ultimate account? In the end, the theist seems bound to admit that why the First Cause created at all was a contingent matter. If, on the contrary, the theist has to claim that the First Cause had to do what it did, would not the cosmos be necessary rather than contingent?

Some theists come close to concluding that it was indeed essential that God created the cosmos. If God is supremely good, there had to be some overflowing of goodness in the form of a cosmos (see Kretzmann and Stump in Morris 1987, on the ideas of Dionysius the Areopagite; see Rowe 2004 for arguments that God is not free). But theists typically reserve some role for the freedom of God and thus seek to retain the idea that the cosmos is contingent. Defenders of the cosmological argument still contend that its account of the cosmos has a comprehensive simplicity lacking in alternative views. God's choices may be contingent, but not God's existence and the Divine choice of creating the cosmos can be understood to be profoundly simple in its supreme, overriding endeavor, namely to create something good. Swinburne has argued that accounting for natural laws in terms of God's will provides for a simple, overarching framework within which to comprehend the order and purposive character of the cosmos (see also Foster 2004). At this point we move from the cosmological to the teleological arguments.

Defenders of the cosmological argument include Swinburne, Richard Taylor, Hugo Meynell, Timothy O'Connor, Bruce Reichenbach, Robert Koons, and William Rowe; prominent opponents include Antony Flew, Michael Martin, Howard Sobel, Nicholas Everitt, and J. L Mackie.

4.2.3 Teleological arguments

These arguments focus on characteristics of the cosmos that seem to reflect the design or intentionality of God or, more modestly, of one or more powerful, intelligent God-like agents. Part of the argument may be formulated as providing evidence that the cosmos is the sort of reality that would be produced by an intelligent being, and then arguing that positing this source is more reasonable than agnosticism or denying it. As in the case of the cosmological argument, the defender of the teleological argument may want to claim only to be giving us some reason for thinking there is a God. Note the way the various arguments might then be brought to bear on each other. If successful, the teleological argument may provide some reason for thinking that the First Cause of the cosmological argument is purposive, while the ontological argument provides some reason for thinking that it makes sense to posit a being that has Divine attributes and necessarily exists. Behind all of them an argument from religious experience may provide some initial reasons to seek further support for a religious conception of the cosmos and to question the adequacy of naturalism.

One version of the teleological argument will depend on the intelligibility of purposive explanation. In our own human case it appears that intentional, purposive explanations are legitimate and can truly account for the nature and occurrence of events. In thinking about an explanation for the ultimate character of the cosmos, is it more likely for the cosmos to be accounted for in terms of a powerful, intelligent agent or in terms of a naturalistic scheme of final laws with no intelligence behind them? Theists employing the teleological argument will draw attention to the order and stability of the cosmos, the emergence of vegetative and animal life, the existence of consciousness, morality, rational agents and the like, in an effort to identify what might plausibly be seen as purposively explicable features of the cosmos. Naturalistic explanations, whether in biology or physics, are then cast as being comparatively local in application when held up against the broader schema of a theistic metaphysics. Darwinian accounts of biological evolution will not necessarily assist us in thinking through why there are either any such laws or any organisms to begin with. Arguments supporting and opposing the teleological argument will then resemble arguments about the cosmological argument, with the negative side contending that there is no need to move beyond a naturalistic account, and the positive side aiming to establish that failing to go beyond naturalism is unreasonable.

In assessing the teleological argument, we can begin with the objection from uniqueness. We cannot compare our cosmos with others to determine which have been designed and which have not. If we could, then we might be able to find support for the argument. If we could compare our cosmos with those we knew to be designed and if the comparison were closer than with those we knew not to be designed, then the argument might be plausible. Without such comparisons, however, the argument fails. Replies to this line of attack have contended that were we to insist that inferences in unique cases were out of order, then we would have to rule out otherwise perfectly respectable scientific accounts of the origin of the cosmos. Besides, while it is not possible to compare the layout of different cosmic histories, it is in principle possible to envisage worlds that seem chaotic, random, or based on laws that cripple the emergence of life. Now we can envisage an intelligent being creating such worlds, but, through considering their features, we can articulate some marks of purposive design to help us judge whether the cosmos was designed rather than created at random. Some critics appeal to the possibility that the cosmos has an infinite history to bolster and re-introduce the uniqueness objection. Given infinite time and chance, it seems likely that something like our world will come into existence, with all its appearance of design. If so, why should we take it to be so shocking that our world has its apparent design, and why should explaining the world require positing one or more intelligent designers? Replies repeat the earlier move of insisting that if the objection were to be decisive, then many seemingly respectable accounts would also have to fall by the wayside. It is often conceded that the teleological argument does not demonstrate that one or more designers are required; it seeks rather to establish that positing such purposive intelligence is reasonable and preferable to naturalism. Recent defenders of the argument this century include George Schlesinger, Robin Collins, and Richard Swinburne. It is rejected by J. L. Mackie, Michael Martin, Nicholas Everitt, and others.

One feature of the teleological argument currently receiving increased attention focuses on epistemology. It has been contended that if we do rely on our cognitive faculties, it is reasonable to believe that these are not brought about by naturalistic forces—forces that are entirely driven by chance or are the outcome of processes not formed by an overriding intelligence. An illustration may help to understand the argument. Imagine coming across what appears to be a sign reporting some information about your current altitude (some rocks in a configuration giving you your current location and precise height above sea-level in meters). If you had reason to believe that this “sign” was totally the result of chance configurations, would it still be reasonable to trust it? Some theists argue that it would not be reasonable, and that trusting our cognitive faculties requires us to accept that they were formed by an overarching, good, creative agent. This rekindles Descartes' point about relying on the goodness of God to ensure that our cognitive faculties are in good working order. Objections to this argument center on naturalistic explanations, especially those friendly to evolution. In evolutionary epistemology, one tries to account for the reliability of cognitive faculties in terms of trial and error leading to survival. A rejoinder by theists is that survival alone is not necessarily linked to true beliefs. It could, in principle, be false beliefs that enhance survival. In fact, some atheists think that believing in God has been crucial to people's survival, though the belief is radically false. Martin and Mackie, among others, object to the epistemic teleological argument; Plantinga, Richard Creel and Richard Taylor defend it.

Two recent developments in teleological argumentation have involved the intelligent design hypothesis and fine tuning arguments.

The first is an argument that there are orders of biological complexity emerging in evolution that are highly unlikely if accounted for by random mutation and natural selection or any other means in the absence of a purposive, intentional force (Behe 2007). Debate on the intelligent design (ID) proposal includes questions of whether it is properly scientific, about the biochemistry involved, and whether (if the ID hypothesis is superior to non-ID accounts) the ID hypothesis can inform us about the nature of the intelligent, designing forces. While the ID hypothesis has been defended as an allegedly scientific account—it is not based on an appeal to Genesis (as Creationism is)—many scientists argue that ID is not a scientific theory because it is neither testable nor falsifiable. Some also argue that ID goes beyond the available evidence and that it systematically underestimates the ability of non-intelligent, natural causes (plus chance) to account for the relevant biological complexity. Critics like Kenneth Miller contend that Behe does not take into sufficient account the adaptive value of very minor changes in evolution (such as the sensitivity to light found in algae and bacteria) that gradually lead to complex organs such as the eye (Miller 1999).

Fine tuning arguments contend that the existence of our cosmos with its suns, planets, life, et al. would not have come about or continued in existence without the constancy of multiple factors. Even minor changes to the nuclear weak force would not have allowed for stars, nor would stars have endured if the ratio of electromagnetism to gravity had been different. John Leslie observes: “Alterations by less than one part in a billion to the expansion speed early in the Big Bang would have led to runaway expansion, everything quickly becoming so dilute that no stars could have formed, or else to gravitational collapse inside under a second” (Leslie 2007, 76). Robin Collins and others have argued that theism better accounts for the fine tuning than naturalism (see Collins 2003; for criticism of the argument, see Craig & Smith 1993).

A more sustained objection against virtually all versions of the teleological argument takes issue with the assumption that the cosmos is good or that it is the sort of thing that would be brought about by an intelligent, completely benevolent being. This leads us directly to the next central concern of the philosophy of God.

4.2.4 Problems of evil

If there is a God who is omnipotent, omniscient, and completely good, why is there evil? The problem of evil is the most widely considered objection to theism in both western and eastern philosophy. There are two general versions of the problem: the deductive or logical version, which asserts that the existence of any evil at all (regardless of its role in producing good) is incompatible with God's existence; and the probabilistic version, which asserts that given the quantity and severity of evil that actually exists, it is unlikely that God exists. The deductive problem is currently less commonly debated because it is widely acknowledged that a thoroughly good being might allow or inflict some harm under certain morally compelling conditions (such as causing a child pain when removing a splinter). More intense debate concerns the likelihood (or even possibility) that there is a completely good God given the vast amount of evil in the cosmos. Consider human and animal suffering caused by death, predation, birth defects, ravaging diseases, virtually unchecked human wickedness, torture, rape, oppression, and “natural disasters.” Consider how often those who suffer are innocent. Why should there be so much gratuitous, apparently pointless evil?

In the face of the problem of evil, some philosophers and theologians deny that God is all-powerful and all-knowing. John Stuart Mill took this line, and panentheist theologians today also question the traditional treatments of Divine power. According to panentheism, God is immanent in the world, suffering with the oppressed and working to bring good out of evil, although in spite of God's efforts, evil will invariably mar the created order. Another response is to think of God as being very different from a moral agent. Brian Davies and others have contended that what it means for God to be good is different from what it means for an agent to be morally good (Davies 2006). A more desperate strategy is to deny the existence of evil, but it is difficult to reconcile traditional monotheism with moral skepticism. Also, insofar as we believe there to be a God worthy of worship and a fitting object of human love, the appeal to moral skepticism will carry little weight. The idea that evil is a privation or twisting of the good may have some currency in thinking through the problem of evil, but it is difficult to see how it alone could go very far to vindicate belief in God's goodness. Searing pain and endless suffering seem altogether real even if they are analyzed as being philosophically parasitic on something valuable. The three great monotheistic traditions, with their ample insistence on the reality of evil, offer little reason to try to defuse the problem of evil by this route. Indeed, classical Judaism, Christianity and Islam are so committed to the existence of evil that a reason to reject evil would be a reason to reject these religious traditions. What would be the point of the Judaic teaching about the Exodus (God liberating the people of Israel from slavery), or the Christian teaching about the incarnation (Christ revealing God as love and releasing a Divine power that will, in the end, conquer death), or the Islamic teaching of Mohammed (the holy prophet of Allah who is all-just and all-merciful) if slavery, hate, death, and injustice did not exist?

In part, the magnitude of the difficulty one takes the problem of evil to pose for theism will depend upon one's commitments in other areas of philosophy, especially ethics, epistemology, and metaphysics. If in ethics you hold that there should be no preventable suffering for any reason, regardless of the cause or consequence, then the problem of evil will conflict with your acceptance of traditional theism. Moreover, if you hold that any solution to the problem of evil should be evident to all persons, then again traditional theism is in jeopardy, for clearly the “solution” is not evident to all. Debate has largely centered on the legitimacy of adopting some middle position: a theory of values that would preserve a clear assessment of the profound evil in the cosmos as well as some understanding of how this might be compatible with the existence of an all powerful, completely good Creator. Could there be reasons why God would permit cosmic ills? If we do not know what those reasons might be, are we in a position to conclude that there are none or that there could not be any? Exploring different possibilities will be shaped by one's metaphysics. For example, if you do not believe there is free will, then you will not be moved by any appeal to the positive value of free will and its role in bringing about good as offsetting its role in bringing about evil.

Theistic responses to the problem of evil distinguish between a defense and a theodicy. A defense seeks to establish that rational belief that God exists is still possible (when the defense is employed against the logical version of the problem of evil) and that the existence of evil does not make it improbable that God exists (when used against the probabilistic version). Some have adopted the defense strategy while arguing that we are in a position to have rational belief in the existence of evil and in a completely good God who hates this evil, even though we may be unable to see how these two beliefs are compatible. A theodicy is more ambitious and is typically part of a broader project, arguing that it is reasonable to believe that God exists on the basis of the good as well as the evident evil of the cosmos. In a theodicy, the project is not to account for each and every evil, but to provide an overarching framework within which to understand at least roughly how the evil that occurs is part of some overall good—for instance, the overcoming of evil is itself a great good. In practice, a defense and a theodicy often appeal to similar factors, the first and foremost being what many call the Greater Good Defense.

4.2.5 Evil and the Greater Good

In the Greater Good Defense, it is contended that evil can be understood as either a necessary accompaniment to bringing about greater goods or an integral part of these goods. Thus, in a version often called the Free Will Defense, it is proposed that free creatures who are able to care for each other and whose welfare depends on each other's freely chosen action constitute a good. For this good to be realized, it is argued, there must be the bona fide possibility of persons harming each other. The free will defense is sometimes used narrowly only to cover evil that occurs as a result, direct or indirect, of human action. But it has been speculatively extended by those proposing a defense rather than a theodicy to cover other evils which might be brought about by supernatural agents other than God. According to the Greater Good case, evil provides an opportunity to realize great values, such as the virtues of courage and the pursuit of justice. Reichenbach (1982), Tennant (1930), Swinburne (1979), and van Inwagen (2006) have also underscored the good of a stable world of natural laws in which animals and humans learn about the cosmos and develop autonomously, independent of the certainty that God exists. Some atheists accord value to the good of living in a world without God, and these views have been used by theists to back up the claim that God might have had reason to create a cosmos in which Divine existence is not overwhelmingly obvious to us. If God's existence were overwhelmingly obvious, then motivations to virtue might be clouded by self-interest and by the bare fear of offending an omnipotent being. Further, there may even be some good to acting virtuously even if circumstances guarantee a tragic outcome. John Hick (1978) so argued and has developed what he construes to be an Irenaean approach to the problem of evil (named after St. Irenaeus of the second century). On this approach, it is deemed good that humanity develops the life of virtue gradually, evolving to a life of grace, maturity, and love. This contrasts with a theodicy associated with St. Augustine, according to which God made us perfect and then allowed us to fall into perdition, only to be redeemed later by Christ. Hick thinks the Augustinian model fails whereas the Irenaean one is credible.

Some have based an argument from the problem of evil on the charge that this is not the best possible world. If there were a supreme, maximally excellent God, surely God would bring about the best possible creation. Because this is not the best possible creation, there is no supreme, maximally excellent God. Following Adams (1987), many now reply that the whole notion of a best possible world, like the highest possible number, is incoherent. For any world that can be imagined with such and such happiness, goodness, virtue and so on, a higher one can be imagined. If the notion of a best possible world is incoherent, would this count against belief that there could be a supreme, maximally excellent being? It has been argued on the contrary that Divine excellences admit of upper limits or maxima that are not quantifiable in a serial fashion (for example, Divine omnipotence involves being able to do anything logically or metaphysically possible, but does not require actually doing the greatest number of acts or a series of acts of which there can be no more).

Those concerned with the problem of evil clash over the question of how one assesses the likelihood of Divine existence. Someone who reports seeing no point to the existence of evil or no justification for God to allow it seems to imply that if there were a point they would see it. Note the difference between seeing no point and not seeing a point. In the cosmic case, is it clear that if there were a reason justifying the existence of evil, we would see it? William Rowe thinks some plausible understanding of God's justificatory reason for allowing the evil should be detectable, but that there are cases of evil that are altogether gratuitous. Defenders like William Hasker and Stephen Wykstra reply that these cases are not decisive counter-examples to the claim that there is a good God. These philosophers hold that we can recognize evil and grasp our duty to do all in our power to prevent or alleviate it. But we should not take our failure to see what reason God might have for allowing evil to count as grounds for thinking that there is no reason. This later move has led to a position commonly called skeptical theism. Michael Bergmann, Michael Rea, and others have argued that we have good reason to be skeptical about whether we can assess whether ostensibly gratuitous evils may or may not be permitted by an all good God (Bergmann 2001; Bergmann and Rea 2005; for criticism see Almeida and Oppy 2003).

Some portraits of an afterlife seem to have little bearing on our response to the magnitude of evil here and now. Does it help to understand why God allows evil if all victims will receive happiness later? But it is difficult to treat the possibility of an afterlife as entirely irrelevant. Is death the annihilation of persons or an event involving a transfiguration to a higher state? If you do not think that it matters whether persons continue to exist after death, then such speculation is of little consequence. But suppose that the afterlife is understood as being morally intertwined with this life, with opportunity for moral and spiritual reformation, transfiguration of the wicked, rejuvenation and occasions for new life, perhaps even reconciliation and communion between oppressors seeking forgiveness and their victims. Then these considerations might help to defend against arguments based on the existence of evil. Insofar as one cannot rule out the possibility of an afterlife morally tied to our life, one cannot rule out the possibility that God brings some good out of cosmic ills.

The most recent work on the afterlife in philosophy of religion has focused on the compatibility of an individual afterlife with some forms of physicalism. Arguably, a dualist treatment of human persons is more promising. If you are not metaphysically identical with your body, then perhaps the annihilation of your body is not the annihilation of you. Today, a range of philosophers have argued that even if physicalism is true, an afterlife is still possible (Peter van Inwagen, Lynne Baker, Trenton Merricks, Kevin Cocoran). The import of this work for the problem of evil is that the possible redemptive value of an afterlife should not be ruled out (without argument) if one assumes physicalism to be true. (For an extraordinary, rich resource on the relevant literature, see The Oxford Handbook of Eschatology, ed. by J. Walls.)

4.2.6 Religious Experience

Perhaps the justification most widely offered for religious belief concerns the occurrence of religious experience or the cumulative weight of testimony of those claiming to have had religious experiences. Putting the latter case in theistic terms, the argument appeals to the fact that many people have testified that they have felt God's presence. Does such testimony provide evidence that God exists? That it is evidence has been argued by Jerome Gellman, Keith Yandell, William Alston, Caroline Davis, Gary Gutting, Kai-Man Kwan, Richard Swinburne and others. That it is not (or that its evidential force is trivial) is argued by Michael Martin, J. L. Mackie, Kai Nielson, Matthew Bagger, John Schellenberg, William Rowe, and others. In an effort to stimulate further investigation, I shall briefly sketch some of the moves and countermoves in the debate.

Objection: Religious experience cannot be experience of God for experience is only sensory and if God is non-physical, God cannot be sensed.

Reply: The thesis that experience is only sensory can be challenged. Yandell marks out some experiences (as when one has “a feeling” someone is present but without having any accompanying sensations) that might provide grounds for questioning a narrow sensory notion of experience.

Objection: Testimony to have experienced God is only testimony that one thinks one has experienced God; it is only testimony of a conviction, not evidence.

Reply: The literature on religious experience testifies to the existence of experience of some Divine being on the basis of which the subject comes to think the experience is of God. If read charitably, the testimony is not testimony to a conviction, but to experiences that form the grounds for the conviction. (See Bagger 1999 for a vigorous articulation of this objection, and note the reply by Kai-man Kwam 2003).

Objection: Because religious experience is unique, how could one ever determine whether it is reliable? We simply lack the ability to examine the object of religious experience in order to test whether the reported experiences are indeed reliable.

Reply: As we learned from Descartes, all our experiences of external objects face a problem of uniqueness. It is possible in principle that all our senses are mistaken and we do not have the public, embodied life we think we lead. We cannot step out of our own subjectivity to vindicate our ordinary perceptual beliefs any more than in the religious case. (See the debate between William Alston and Evan Fales 2004).

Objection: Reports of religious experience differ radically and the testimony of one religious party neutralizes the testimony of others. The testimony of Hindus cancels out the testimony of Christians. The testimony of atheists to experience God's absence cancels out the testimony of “believers.”

Reply: Several replies might be offered here. Testimony to experience the absence of God might be better understood as testimony not to experience God. Failing to experience God might be justification for believing that there is no God only to the extent that we have reason to believe that if God exists God would be experienced by all. Theists might even appeal to the claim by many atheists that it can be virtuous to live ethically with atheist beliefs. Perhaps if there is a God, God does not think this is altogether bad, and actually desires religious belief to be fashioned under conditions of trust and faith rather than knowledge. The diversity of religious experiences has caused some defenders of the argument from religious experience to mute their conclusion. Thus, Gutting (1982) contends that the argument is not strong enough to fully vindicate a specific religious tradition, but that it is strong enough to overturn an anti-religious naturalism. Other defenders use their specific tradition to deal with ostensibly competing claims based on different sorts of religious experiences. Theists have proposed that more impersonal experiences of the Divine represent only one aspect of God. God is a person or is person-like, but God can also be experienced, for example, as sheer luminous unity. Hindus have claimed the experience of God as personal is only one stage in the overall journey of the soul to truth, the highest truth being that Brahman transcends personhood. (For a discussion of these objections and replies and references, see Taliaferro 1998.)

How one settles the argument will depend on one's overall convictions in many areas of philosophy. The holistic, interwoven nature of both theistic and atheistic arguments can be readily illustrated. If you diminish the implications of religious experience and have a high standard regarding the burden of proof for any sort of religious outlook, then it is highly likely that the classical arguments for God's existence will not be persuasive. Moreover, if one thinks that theism can be shown to be intellectually confused from the start, then theistic arguments from religious experience will carry little weight. Testimony to have experienced God will have no more weight than testimony to have experienced a round square, and non-religious explanations of religious experience—like those of Freud (a result of wish-fulfillment), Marx (a reflection of the economic base) or Durkheim (a product of social forces)—will increase their appeal. If, on the other hand, you think the theistic picture is coherent and that the testimony of religious experience provides some evidence for theism, then your assessment of the classical theistic arguments might be more favorable, for they would serve to corroborate and further support what you already have some reason to believe. From such a vantage point, appeal to wish-fulfillment, economics, and social forces might have a role, but the role is to explain why some parties do not have experiences of God and to counter the charge that failure to have such experiences provides evidence that there is no religious reality. For an excellent collection of recent work on explaining the emergence and continuation of religious experience, see Schloss and Murray (eds.) 2009.

There is not space to cover the many other arguments for and against the existence of God, but several additional arguments are briefly noted. The argument from miracles starts from specific extraordinary events, arguing that they provide reasons for believing there to be a supernatural agent or, more modestly, reasons for skepticism about the sufficiency of a naturalistic world view. The argument has attracted much philosophical attention, especially since David Hume's rejection of miracles. The debate has turned mainly on how one defines a miracle, understands the laws of nature, and specifies the principles of evidence that govern the explanation of highly unusual historical occurrences. There is considerable debate over whether Hume's case against miracles simply begs the question against “believers.” Detailed exposition is impossible in this short entry, but I argue elsewhere that Hume's case against miracles is most charitably seen as part of his overall case for naturalism (Taliaferro 2005).

There are various arguments that are advanced to motivate religious belief. One of the most interesting and popular is a wager argument often associated with Pascal (1623–1662). It is designed to offer practical reasons to cultivate a belief in God. Imagine that you are unsure whether there is or is not a God. You have it within your power to live on either assumption and perhaps, through various practices, to get yourself to believe one or the other. There would be good consequences of believing in God even if your belief were false, and if the belief were true you would receive even greater good. There would also be good consequences of believing that there is no God, but in this case the consequences would not alter if you were correct. If, however, you believe that there is no God and you are wrong, then you would risk losing the many goods which follow from the belief that God exists and from actual Divine existence. On this basis, it may seem reasonable to believe there is a God.

In different forms the argument may be given a rough edge (for example, imagine that if you do not believe in God and there is a God, hell is waiting). It may be put as an appeal to individual self-interest (you will be better off) or more generally (believers whose lives are bound together can realize some of the goods comprising a mature religious life). Objectors worry about whether one ever is able to bring choices down to just such a narrow selection—for example, to choose either theism or naturalism. Some think the argument is too thoroughly egotistic and thus offensive to religion. Many of these objections have generated some plausible replies (Rescher 1985). For a thoroughgoing exploration of the relevant arguments, see the collection of essays edited by Jeffrey Jordan (1994).

Recent work on Pascalian wagering has a bearing on work on the nature of faith (is it voluntary or involuntary?), its value (when, if ever, is it a virtue?), and relation to evidence (insofar as faith involves belief, is it possible to have faith without evidence?). For an excellent overview and promising analysis, see Chappell (1996), Swinburne (1979), and Schellenberg (2005). A promising feature of such new work is that it is often accompanied by a rich understanding of revelation that is not limited to a sacred scripture, but sees a revelatory role in scripture plus the history of its interpretation, the use of creeds, icons, and so on (see the work of William Abraham).

Two interesting new, rather different developments in debate over the evidence for God's existence need to be observed. John Schellenberg has developed what may be called the “hiddenness of God objection.” Schellenberg argues that perfect love necessarily belongs to any personal Divine being, and that such perfect love entails openness to a personal relationship with the Divine being, a relationship that would require creatures to know or at least be aware of the Divine being. Schellenberg then contends that the fact that there are many nonbelievers in this God of love who would not resist God's disclosure (whether through religious experience or argument) is evidence against the existence of a personal Divine being. The Divine being or God would have been more evident (see Shellenberg 2007; for a reply, see Taliaferro 2009).

In a private communication, Schellenberg has pointed out that his target is not only the God of Christianity but “any personal Divine being.” Making the above adjustment about “any personal Divine being” and Schellenberg's point about “perfect love” and its entailments will make clearer the scope of Schellenberg's project. Taking a very different approach to theism, Paul Moser has recently criticized what he refers to as the preoccupation in philosophy of religion with what he calls “spectator evidence for God,” evidence that can be assessed without involving any interior change that would transform a person morally and religiously. Eschewing fideism, Moser holds that when one seeks God and willingly allows oneself to be transformed by God's perfect love, one's very life can become evidence of the reality of God (see Moser 2008, 2010). While this proposal may worry secular philosophers of religion, Moser is not out of keeping with the pre-Christian Platonic tradition that maintained that inquiry into the good, the true, and the beautiful involved inquiry in which the inquirer needed to endeavor to be good, true, and beautiful.

Another burgeoning question in recent years is whether the cognitive science of religion (CSR) has significance for the truth or rationality of religious commitment. According to CSR, belief in supernatural agents appears to be cognitively natural (Barrett 2004, Keleman 2004, Dennett 2006, De Cruz, H., & De Smedt, J. 2010) and easy to spread (Boyer 2001). The naturalness of religion thesis has led some, including Alvin Plantinga it seems (2011: 60), to imply that we have scientific evidence for Calvin's sensus divinitatis. But others have argued that CSR can intensify the problem of divine hiddenness, since diverse religious concepts are cognitively natural and early humans seem to have lacked anything like a theistic concept (Marsh 2013). There are many other questions being investigated about CSR, such as whether it provides a debunking challenge to religion (Murray and Schloss 2009), whether it poses a cultural challenge for religious outlooks like Schellenberg's Ultimism (Marsh forthcoming), and whether it challenges human dignity (Audi 2013). Needless to say, at the present time, anyhow, there is nothing like a clear consensus on whether CSR should be seen as worrisome, welcome, or neither, by religious believers.

5. Religious Pluralism

In the midst of the new work on religious traditions, there has been a steady, growing representation of non-monotheistic traditions. An early proponent of this expanded format was Ninian Smart, who, through many publications, scholarly as well as popular, secured philosophies of Hinduism and Buddhism as components in the standard canon of English-speaking philosophy of religion.

Smart championed the thesis that there are genuine differences between religious traditions. He therefore resisted seeing some core experience as capturing the essential identity of being religious. Under Smart's tutelage, there has been considerable growth in cross-cultural philosophy of religion. Wilfred Cantwell Smith also did a great deal to improve the representation of non-Western religions and reflection.

The explanation of philosophy of religion has involved fresh translations of philosophical and religious texts from India, China, Southeast Asia, and Africa. Exceptional figures from non-Western traditions have an increased role in cross-cultural philosophy of religion and religious dialogue. The late Bimal Krishna Matilal made salient contributions to enrich Western exposure to Indian philosophy of religion. Among the mid-twentieth-century Asian philosophers, two who stand out for special note are T.R.V. Murti (1955) and S.N. Dasgupta (1922). Both brought high philosophical standards along with the essential philology to educate Western thinkers. As evidence of non-Western productivity in the Anglophone world, see Arvind Sharma 1990 and 1995. There are now extensive treatments of pantheism and student-friendly guides to diverse religious conceptions of the cosmos.

The expanded interest in religious pluralism has led to extensive reflection on the compatibility and possible synthesis of religions. John Hick is the preeminent synthesizer of religious traditions. In an important book, Hick (1974) advanced a complex picture of the afterlife involving components from diverse traditions. Over many publications and many years, Hick has moved from a broadly based theistic view of God to what Hick calls “the Real,” a noumenal sacred reality. Hick claims that different religions provide us with a glimpse or partial access to the Real. In an influential article, “The New Map of the Universe of Faiths,” Hick raised the possibility that many of the great world religions are revelatory of the Real.

Seen in [an] historical context these movements of faith—the Judaic-Christian, the Buddhist, the Hindu, the Muslim—are not essentially rivals. They began at different times and in different places, and each expanded outwards into the surrounding world of primitive natural religion until most of the world was drawn up into one or the other of the great revealed faiths. And once this global pattern had become established it has ever since remained fairly stable... Then in Persia the great prophet Zoroaster appeared; China produced Lao-tzu and then the Buddha lived, the Mahavira, the founder of the Jain religion and, probably about the end of this period, the writing of the Bhagavad Gita; and Greece produced Pythagoras and then, ending this golden age, Socrates and Plato. Then after the gap of some three hundred years came Jesus of Nazareth and the emergence of Christianity; and after another gap the prophet Mohammed and the rise of Islam. The suggestion that we must consider is that these were all movements of the divine revelation. [emphasis added] (Hick 1989, 136)

Hick sees these traditions, and others as well, as different meeting points in which a person might be in relation to the same reality or the Real: “The great world faiths embody different perceptions and conceptions of, and correspondingly different responses to, the Real from within the major variant ways of being human; and that within each of them the transformation of human existence from self-centeredness to Reality-centeredness is taking place” (Ibid., 240). Hick uses Kant to develop his central thesis.

Kant distinguishes between noumenon and phenomenon, or between a Ding an sich [the thing itself] and the thing as it appears to human consciousness…. In this strand of Kant's thought—not the only strand, but the one which I am seeking to press into service in the epistemology of religion—the noumenal world exists independently of our perception of it and the phenomenal world is that same world as it appears to our human consciousness…. I want to say that the noumenal Real is experienced and thought by different human mentalities, forming and formed by different religious traditions, as the range of gods and absolutes which the phenomenology of religion reports. (Ibid., 241–242)

One advantage of Hick's position is that it undermines a rationale for religious conflict. If successful, this approach would offer a way to accommodate diverse communities and undermine what has been a source of grave conflict in the past.

Hick's work since the early 1980's provided an impetus for not taking what appears to be religious conflict as outright contradictions. He advanced a philosophy of religion that paid careful attention to the historical and social context. By doing so, Hick thought the apparent conflict between seeing the Real as the personal or the impersonal reality could be reconciled (see Hick 2004, 2006).

The response to Hick's proposal has been mixed. Some contend that the very concept of “the Real” is incoherent (Plantinga) or not religiously adequate. Indeed, articulating the nature of the real is no easy task. Hick writes that the Real “cannot be said to be one thing or many, person or thing, substance or process, good or bad, purposive or non-purposive. None of the concrete descriptions that apply within the realm of human experience can apply literally to the unexperienceable ground of that realm…. We cannot even speak of this as a thing or an entity” (Ibid., 246). It has been argued that Hick has secured not the equal acceptability of diverse religions but rather their unacceptability. In their classical forms, Judaism, Islam, and Christianity diverge. If, say, the Incarnation of God in Christ did not occur, isn't Christianity false? In reply, Hick has sought to interpret specific claims about the Incarnation in ways that do not commit Christians to the “literal truth” of God becoming enfleshed. The “truth” of the Incarnation has been interpreted in such terms as these: in Jesus Christ (or in the narratives about Christ) God is disclosed. Or: Jesus Christ was so united with God's will that his actions were and are the functional display of God's character. Perhaps as a result of Hick's challenge, philosophical work on the incarnation and other beliefs and practice specific to religious traditions have received renewed attention (see, for example, Taliaferro and Meister 2010). Hick has been a leading, widely appreciated force in the expansion of philosophy of religion in the late twentieth century.

In addition to the expansion of philosophy of religion to take into account a wider set of religions, the field has also seen an expansion in terms of methodology. Philosophers of religion have re-discovered medieval philosophy—the new translations and commentaries of medieval Christian, Jewish, and Islamic texts have blossomed. There is now a self-conscious, deliberate effort to combine work on the concepts in religious belief alongside a critical understanding of their social and political roots (the work of Foucault has been influential on this point), feminist philosophy of religion has been especially important in re-thinking what may be called the ethics of methodology and, as this is in some respects the most current debate in the field, it is a fitting point to end this entry by highlighting the work of Pamela Sue Anderson and others.

Anderson (1997 and 2012) seeks to question respects in which gender enters into traditional conceptions of God and in their moral and political repercussions. She also advances a concept of method which delimits justice and human flourishing. A mark of legitimation of philosophy should be the extent to which it contributes to human welfare. In a sense, this is a venerable thesis in some ancient, specifically Platonic philosophy which envisaged the goal and method of philosophy in terms of virtue and the good. Feminist philosophy today is not exclusively a critical undertaking, critiquing “patriarchy.” For a constructive, subtle treatment of religious contemplation and practice, see Coakley (2002). Another key movement that is developing has come to be called Continental Philosophy of Religion. A major advocate of this new turn is John Caputo. This movement approaches the themes of this entry (the concept of God, pluralism, religious experience, metaphysics and epistemology) in light of Heidegger, Derrida, and other continental philosophers. For a good representation of this movement, see Caputo 2001.

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Acknowledgments

I am indebted to John Deck and Cara Stevens for comments and assistance in preparing this entry. I also wish to thank Thomas Churchill for his work editing the final version. [Editors Note, March 2018: Portions of this entry appeared previously in C. Taliaferro, “Philosophy of Religion”, in N. Bunnin and E.P. Tsui-James (eds.), The Blackwell Companion to Philosophy, 2nd edition, Oxford: Blackwell, 2003.]

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Charles Taliaferro <taliafer@stolaf.edu>

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