Supplement to Supervenience
Appendix: List of Definitions
For ease of reference, the technical definitions discussed in earlier sections are collected in this section. ‘A’ and ‘B’ should be understood as variables ranging over non-empty sets of properties (though the quantification is typically implicit).
Individual Supervenience
- Weak Individual Supervenience
- Possible-Worlds Formulation: A weakly supervenes on B iff for any possible world w and any individuals x and y in w, if x and y are B-indiscernible in w, then they are A-indiscernible in w.
Modal Operator Formulation: A weakly supervenes on B iff necessarily, if anything x has some property F in A, then there is at least one property G in B such that x has G, and everything that has G has F.
□∀x∀F∈A[Fx → ∃G∈B(Gx & ∀y(Gy→Fy))]- Strong Individual Supervenience
- Possible-Worlds Formulation: A strongly supervenes on B iff for any possible worlds w1 and w2 and any individuals x in w1 and y in w2, if x in w1 is B-indiscernible from y in w2, then x in w1 is A-indiscernible from y in w2.
Modal Operator Formulation: A strongly supervenes on B iff necessarily, if anything x has some property F in A, then there is at least one property G in B such x has G, and necessarily everything that has G has F.
□∀x∀F∈A[Fx → ∃G∈B(Gx & □∀y(Gy→Fy))]
- Regional Supervenience
- Weak: A weak-regionally supervenes on
B iff for any possible world w and any space-time
regions r1 and
r2 in w, if
r1 and r2
are exactly alike in every intrinsic B-respect in w,
then they are exactly alike in every intrinsic A-respect in
w.
Strong: A strong-regionally supervenes on B iff for any possible worlds w1 and w2 and any space-time regions r1 in w1 and spacetime region r2 in w2, if r1 in w1 is exactly like r2 in w2 in every intrinsic B-respect, then r1 in w1 is exactly like r2 in w2 in every intrinsic A-respect.
- Similarity-Based Supervenience
- Weak Similarity-Based: A weakly
supervenes on B iff for any world w, and for any
x and y in w, if x and y
are not largely different with respect to B-properties, then
they are not largely different with respect to A-properties.
Strong Similarity-Based: A strongly supervenes on B iff for any worlds w1 and w2, and for any x in w1 and y in w2, if x in w1 is not largely different from y in w2 with respect to B-properties, then x in w1 is not largely different from y in w2 with respect to A-properties.
- Global Supervenience
- Generic Global: A globally supervenes on
B iff for any worlds w1
and w2, if
w1 and
w2 have exactly the same world-wide
pattern of distribution of B-properties, then they have
exactly the same world-wide pattern of distribution of
A-properties.
Weak Global: A weakly globally supervenes on B iff for any worlds w1 and w2, if there is a B-preserving isomorphism between w1 and w2, then there is an A-preserving isomorphism between them.
Intermediate Global: A intermediately globally supervenes on B iff for any worlds w1 and w2, if there is a B-preserving isomorphism between w1 and w2, then there is an A-and-B-preserving isomorphism between w1 and w2.
Strong Global: A strongly globally supervenes on B iff for any worlds w1 and w2, every B-preserving isomorphism between w1 and w2 is an A-preserving isomorphism between them.
- Multiple Domain Supervenience
-
Weak Multiple Domain: A weakly supervenes on
B relative to relation R just in for any world
w and any x and y in w, if
R|x in w is B-indiscernible from
R|y in w, then x and y are
A-indiscernible in w.
Strong Multiple Domain: A strongly supervenes on B relative to relation R just in case for any worlds w1 and w2, any x in w1 and y in w2, if R|x in w1 is B-indiscernible from R|y in w2, x in w1 is A-indiscernible from y in w2.
Weak Coincident-Friendly: For any world w and any x and y in w, if x in w is B-indiscernible from y in w, then for each thing x* in w to which x is R-related, there is something y* in w to which y is R-related, and which is A-indiscernible from x*.
Strong Coincident-Friendly: For all x and y, and all worlds w1 and w2, if x in w1 is B-indiscernible from y in w2, then for each thing x* in w1 to which x is R-related, there is something y* in w2 to which y is R-related, and which is A-indiscernible from x*.
