Teleological Notions in Biology

First published Wed Mar 20, 1996; substantive revision Sun May 18, 2003

Teleological terms such as "function" and "design" appear frequently in the biological sciences. Examples of teleological claims include:

  • A (biological) function of stotting by antelopes is to communicate to predators that they have been detected.
  • Eagles' wings are (naturally) designed for soaring.

Teleological notions were commonly associated with the pre-Darwinian view that the biological realm provides evidence of conscious design by a supernatural creator. Even after creationist viewpoints were rejected by most biologists there remained various grounds for concern about the role of teleology in biology, including whether such terms are:

  1. vitalistic (positing some special "life-force");
  2. requiring backwards causation (because future outcomes explain present traits);
  3. incompatible with mechanistic explanation (because of 1 and 2);
  4. mentalistic (attributing the action of mind where there is none);
  5. empirically untestable (for all the above reasons).

Opinions divide over whether Darwin's theory of evolution provides a means of eliminating teleology from biology, or whether it provides a naturalistic account of the role of teleological notions in the science. Many contemporary biologists and philosophers of biology believe that teleological notions are a distinctive and ineliminable feature of biological explanations but that it is possible to provide a naturalistic account of their role that avoids the concerns above. Terminological issues sometimes serve to obscure some widely-accepted distinctions.

Teleomentalism

Teleomentalists regard the teleology of psychological intentions, goals, and purposes as the primary model for understanding teleology in biology. Aside from creationism, the most common form of teleomentalist view is that teleological claims in biology are mere metaphor — describing and explaining biological phenomena on the basis of more or less loose comparisons to psychological teleology. Those who hold teleology in biology to be metaphorical in nature typically regard it as eliminable; i.e., they believe that the science of biology would not be essentially altered if all references to teleology were eschewed.

Teleonaturalism

Those who reject teleomentalism typically seek naturalistic truth conditions for teleological claims in biology that do not refer to the intentions, goals, or purposes of psychological agents. Some teleonaturalists seek to reduce teleological language to forms of description and explanation that are found in other parts of science. One class of such views defines teleological notions cybernetically and maintains that teleology in biology is appropriate insofar as biological systems are cybernetic systems. Another, more widely-accepted approach treats functional claims in biology as part of the analysis of the capacities of a complex system into various component capacities.

Other forms of teleonaturalism regard the teleological aspects of biology as unique and ineliminable. One class of such views maintains that teleological claims in biology depend on natural values that apply to biological entities (such as what is good for an organism or species). A different approach, that avoids normative notions, is to define biological teleology explicitly in terms of natural selection and the theory of evolution.

Several theorists have argued for the pluralistic idea that biology may incorporate two notions of function, one to explain the presence of traits and the other to explain how those traits contribute to the complex capacities of organisms. Others have argued that these two apparently distinct notions of function can be unified by regarding the target of explanation as the biological fitness of a whole organism. Nonetheless, the mainstream view among philosophers of biology is that natural selection accounts best explain the majority of uses of teleological notions in biology.

Natural Selection Analyses of Function

Accounts of biological function which refer to natural selection typically have the form that a trait's function or functions causally explain the existence or maintenance of that trait in a given population via the mechanism of natural selection. Three components of this view can be usefully separated:

  1. Functional claims in biology are intended to explain the existence or maintenance of a trait in a given population;
  2. Biological functions are causally relevant to the existence or maintenance of traits via the mechanism of natural selection;
  3. Functional claims in biology are fully grounded in natural selection and are not derivative of psychological uses of notions such as design, intention, and purpose.

Variations on this account mostly center on the first two points.

  1. Some theorists maintain a distinction between the initial spread of a new phenotypic trait in a population from the maintenance of traits in populations.
  2. Some theorists adopt an etiological or backward-looking approach that analyzes the function of a trait only in terms of those effects of the trait which have in the past contributed to the selection of organisms with that trait. Others adopt a dispositional or forward-looking approach that analyzes function in terms of those effects it is disposed to produce that tend to contribute to the present or future maintenance of the trait in a population of organisms.

Function and Design

In the debate about biological teleology, relatively little attention has been paid to the notion of natural design. It is common for authors to slide between claims about function and design as if they accept this principle:

A trait T is naturally designed for X if and only if X is a biological function of T.

Collapsing the notions of design and function in this manner has the advantage that if the notion of biological function is successfully naturalized then so is the notion of natural design.

The biological notion of design seems, however, to imply more than mere usefulness. Female turtles use their flippers to dig nests in sand, and doing so surely accounts for the maintenance of the trait in the population. So, on an etiological account, digging in sand is a function of the flippers. Yet it seems wrong to say that they are designed for that purpose. This suggests that function and design should be analyzed separately. One way to do this is as follows:

Trait T is naturally designed to do X means that
  1. X is a biological function of T and
  2. T is the result of a process of change of (anatomical or behavioral) structure due to natural selection that has resulted in T being more optimal (or better adapted) for X than ancestral versions of T.

With respect to this analysis, to say that an eagle's wings are designed for soaring is to claim, first, that the ability to soar (as opposed to other kinds of flying) explains why some ancestral eagles had higher reproductive fitness than others and, second, that eagles' wings are better adapted for soaring than were ancestral versions of the wings. This second part is an historical claim that might be checked against the fossil record.

Adaptation, Exaptation and Co-opted Use

The notion of adaptation is controversial among biologists because it suggests the Panglossian belief that this is the best of all possible worlds. However comparative judgments about traits of organisms, e.g., that the traits of present organisms are better at producing some effect than the corresponding traits of ancestral organisms, do not require the Panglossian assumption. This is because the claim that A is more optimal or better adapted than B with respect to some function does not entail that A is optimal or even good with respect to that function.

Gould & Vrba (1982) would deny that sand-digging is a function of turtle flippers and prefer instead to label it an "exaptation". They recommend the use of "function" only when natural selection has "shaped" a trait for some use — i.e. the trait has undergone some modification in form that makes it more suited to the use. This recommendation, however, seeks to change ordinary biological usage rather than to elucidate it. Because it conflates the notions of design and function, it becomes necessary to mark the distinction between cases of selection with modification (function/design) and cases where a trait of an organism is coopted for a use for which it is not modified (exaptation). Even if the flippers of turtles are not specially modified for burying eggs in sand, the fact that they were so used helps to explain why turtles with flippers were selected over those without. Whether one prefers to call this a function or an exaptation is a terminological issue perhaps to be settled by one's taste for neologisms.

Bibliography

Works cited

  • Gould, S.J. and Vrba, E.S. "Exaptation - a missing term in the science of form," Paleobiology 8 (1982): 4-15.

Anthologies

  • Allen, C., Bekoff, M., & Lauder, G. (eds.) (1998) Nature's Purposes Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Ariew, A., Cummins, R., & Perlman, M. (eds.) (2002) Functions: New Essays in the Philosophy of Psychology and Biology
  • Baerends, G., Beer, C. and Manning, A. (eds.) (1975). Function and Evolution in Behaviour: Essays in Honor of Niko Tinbergen. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Buller, D. (ed.) (1999) Function, Selection, and Design Albany, NY: SUNY Press.
  • Rescher, N. (ed.) (1986) Current Issues in Teleology. Lanham, MD: University Press of America.

Review Papers

  • Allen, C. and Bekoff, M. (1995) "Function, natural design, and animal behavior: philosophical and ethological considerations," in N.S. Thompson (ed.) Perspectives in Ethology, Volume 11: Behavioral Design. NY: Plenum Press, pp.1-47.
  • Bekoff, M. & Allen, C. (1995) "Teleology, function, design, and the evolution of animal behavior." Trends in Ecology and Evolution 10(6): 253-255.
  • Buller, D. (1998). "Etiological theories of function: a geographical survey. Biology and Philosophy 505-527. Reprinted in Buller (1999).

Primary Sources

  • Achinstein, P. (1977). "Function statements." Philosophy of Science 44: 360-376.
  • Adams, F. (1979). "A goal-state theory of function attributions." Canadian Journal of Philosophy 9: 493-518.
  • Allen, C. &: Bekoff, M. (1995). "Biological function, adaptation, and natural design." Philosophy of Science 62: 609-622. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder (1998) and in Buller (1999).
  • Amundson, R., & Lauder, G. (1994). "Function without purpose: the uses of causal role function in evolutionary biology." Biology and Philosophy 9: 443-469. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder (1998).
  • Ayala, F.J. (1977). "Teleological explanations." In T. Dobzhansky (ed.) Evolution, San Francisco: W.H. Freeman and Co., pp.497-504. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder (1998).
  • Bechtel, W. (1986). "Teleological functional analyses and the hierarchichal organization of nature." In N. Rescher ed. Current Issues in Teleology. Lanham, MD: University Press of America.
  • Beckner, M. (1969). "Function and teleology." Journal of History of Biology 2: 151-164.
  • Bedau, M. (1990). "Against mentalism in teleology." American Philosophical Quarterly 27(1): 61-70.
  • Bedau, M. (1991). "Can biological teleology be naturalized?" Journal of Philosophy 88: 647-57.
  • Bedau, M. (1992). "Where's the good in teleology?" Philosophy and Phenomenolical Research 52(4): 781-805.
  • Bedau, M.A. and Packard, N.H. (1991). "Measurement of evolutionary activity, teleology, and life." In C. G. Langton, C. E. Taylor, J. D. Farmer, and S. Rasmussen (eds.) Artificial Life II, SFI Studies in the Sciences of Complexity Vol. X. Redwood City, CA: Addison-Wesley, pp.431-483.
  • Beer, C.G. (1975). "Multiple functions and gull displays." In Baerends, G., Beer, C. and Manning, A. eds. (1975). Function and Evolution in Behaviour: Essays in Honor of Niko Tinbergen. Oxford: Clarendon Press, pp. 16-54.
  • Bigelow, J. and Pargetter, R. (1987). Functions. Journal of Philosophy 86(4): 181-196. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998) and in Buller (1999).
  • Bock, W., and von Wahlert, G. (1965). "Adaptation and the form-function complex." Evolution 19: 269-299. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998).
  • Boorse, C. (1976). "Wright on functions." Philosophical Review 85: 70-86.
  • Brandon, R.N. (1981). "Biological teleology: questions and explanations." Studies in the History and Philosophy of Science 12: 91-105. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998).
  • Cummins, R. (1975). "Functional Analysis." Journal of Philosophy 72: 741.765. Reprinted with minor alterations in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998) and in Buller (1999).
  • Dawkins, R. (1986). The Blind Watchmaker New York: Norton.
  • Enç, B. and Adams, F. (1992). "Functions and goal directedness." Philosophy of Science 59(4): 635-654.
  • Gans, C. (1988). "Adaptation and the form-function relation." American Zoologist 28: 681-697. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder (1998).
  • Godfrey-Smith, P. (1993). "Functions: consensus without unity." Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 74: 196-208. Reprinted in Buller (1999).
  • Godfrey-Smith, P. (1994). "A modern history theory of functions." Nous 28: 344-362. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998) and in Buller (1999).
  • Goode, R. and Griffiths, P.E. (1995) "The misuses of Sober's selection for/selection of distinction." Biology and Philosophy 10: 99-108. Reprinted in Buller (1999).
  • Gould, S.J. and Vrba, E.S. (1982). "Exaptation--a missing term in the science of form." Paleobiology 8: 4-15. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998).
  • Griffiths, P.E. (1993). Functional analysis and proper functions. British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 44: 409-422. Reprinted in Buller (1999).
  • Hempel, C.G. (1965). "The logic of functional analysis," in Aspects of Scientific Explanation New York: Free Press.
  • Hinde, R.A. (1975). "The concept of function." In Baerends, G., Beer, C. and Manning, A. eds. (1975). Function and Evolution in Behaviour: Essays in Honor of Niko Tinbergen. Oxford: Clarendon Press, pp. 3-15.
  • Kitcher, P. (1994). "Function and Design." Midwest Studies in Philosophy 18: 379-397. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder (1998) and in Buller (1999).
  • Lauder, G. (1982). "Historical biology and the problem of design." Journal of Theoretical Biology 97:57-67. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder (1998).
  • Lipton, P. and Thompson, N.S. (1988a). Comparative Psychology and the Recursive Structure of Filter Explanations. International Journal of Comparative Psychology 1(4): 215-229.
  • Lipton, P. and Thompson, N.S. (1988b). Response: Why Dr. Tinbergen is more sound than Dr. Pangloss. International Journal of Comparative Psychology 1(4): 238-244.
  • Lorenz, K.Z. (1981). The Foundations of Ethology, New York: Springer-Verlag.
  • Mace, C.A. (1935). "Mechanical and teleological causation." Proc. Arist. Soc., Supp. 14; reprinted in H. Feigl and W. Sellars (eds.) (1949). Readings in Philosophical Analysis, New York: Appleton-Century-Crofts, pp.534-539.
  • Mayr, E. "The multiple meanings of teleological," in Towards a New Philosophy of Biology. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press (1988), pp. 38-66.
  • Millikan, R.G. (1984). Language Thought and Other Biological Categories. MIT Press, Cambridge, MA.
  • Millikan, R.G. (1989a). "In defense of proper functions." Philosophy of Science 56: 288-302. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998).
  • Millikan, R.G. (1989b). "An ambiguity in the notion of function." Biology and Philosophy 4: 172-176. Reprinted in Buller (1999).
  • Millikan, R.G. (1993). White Queen Psychology and other essays for Alice. MIT Press, Cambridge, MA.
  • Mitchell, S. (1993). "Dispositions or etiologies? A comment on Bigelow and Pargetter." Journal of Philosophy 90: 249-259.
  • Mitchell, S. (1995). "Function, fitness, and disposition." Biology & Philosophy 10: 39-54. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder 1998.
  • Mitchell, W.A. (1990). "The optimization research program: studying adaptations by their function." Quarterly Review of Biology 65(1): 43-52.
  • Nagel, E. (1961). "The structure of teleological explanations," in The Structure of Science, pp.401-427, Hackett.
  • Nagel, E. (1977). "Teleology revisited: goal-directed processes in biology." Journal of Philosophy 74: 261-301. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder (1998).
  • Neander, K. (1991a). "The teleological notion of ‘function’." Australasian Journal of Philosophy 69(4): 454-468.
  • Neander, K. (1991b). "Functions as selected effects: the conceptual analyst's defence." Philosophy of Science 58: 168-184.
  • Nissen, L. (1993). "Four ways of eliminating mind from teleology." Studies in the History and Philosophy of Science 24(1): 27-48.
  • Pittendrigh, C.S. (1958). "Adaptation, natural selection and behavior." In Roe, A. and Simpson, G.G. (eds.) Behavior and Evolution. Yale University Press, New Haven, CT, pp.390-419.
  • Plantinga, A. (1993). Warrant and proper function. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Reeve, H.K. and Sherman, P.W. (1993). "Adaptation and the goals of evolutionary research." Quarterly Review of Biology 68(1): 1-32.
  • Rudwick, M.J.S. (1964). "The inference of function form structure in fossils." British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 12: 91-105. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff, & Lauder (1998).
  • Sober, E. (1984). The Nature of Selection. MIT Press, Cambridge, MA.
  • Sober, E. (1993). Philosophy of biology. Boulder, CO : Westview Press.
  • Thompson, N.S. (1987). "The Misappropriation of Teleonomy." In, P.P.G.B. Bateson and P. Klopfer (eds.) Perspectives in Ethology 7: 259-274.
  • Tinbergen, N. (1952). "Derived" activities, their causation, biological significance and emancipation during evolution. Quarterly Review of Biology 27: 1-32.
  • Tinbergen, N. (1963). "On aims and methods of ethology." Zeitschrift für Tierpsychologie 20: 410-429.
  • Van Parijs, P. (1982). Evolutionary Explanation in the Social Sciences: an emerging paradigm. Totowa, NJ: Rowman and Littlefield.
  • Walsh, D. and Ariew, A. (1996). "A taxonomy of functions." Canadian Journal of Philosophy 493-514. Reprinted in Buller (1999).
  • West-Eberhard, M. J. 1992. "Adaptation: current usages." In E.F. Keller and E.A. Lloyd (eds.) Keywords in Evolutionary Biology, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, pp.13-18.
  • Williams, G.C. (1966). Adaptation and Natural Selection, Princeton, NJ.: Princeton University Press.
  • Wimsatt, W.C. (1972). "Teleology and the logical structure of function statements." Studies in the History and Philosophy of Science 3(1),1-80.
  • Wouters, A. (1999). "Explanation Without a Cause." Utrecht, The Netherlands: Zeno Institute of Philosophy.
  • Wright, L. (1973). "Functions." Philosophical Review 82: 139-168. Reprinted in Allen, Bekoff & Lauder (1998) and in Buller (1999).
  • Wright, L. (1976). Teleological Explanations. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press.

Other Internet Resources

  • Please contact the author with suggestions.

Copyright © 2003 by
Colin Allen

This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Please note that some links may no longer be functional.
[an error occurred while processing the directive]