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Alfred North Whitehead

First published Tue May 21, 1996; substantive revision Tue Mar 10, 2015

Alfred North Whitehead (1861–1947) was a British mathematician, logician and philosopher best known for his work in mathematical logic and the philosophy of science. In collaboration with Bertrand Russell, he co-authored the landmark three-volume Principia Mathematica (1910, 1912, 1913). Later he was instrumental in pioneering the approach to metaphysics now known as process philosophy.

Although there are important continuities throughout his career, Whitehead's intellectual life is often divided into three main periods. The first corresponds roughly to his time at Cambridge, from 1884 to 1910. It was during these years that he worked primarily on issues in mathematics and logic. It was also during this time that he collaborated with Russell. The second main period, from 1910 to 1924, corresponds roughly to his time at London. During these years Whitehead concentrated mainly, but not exclusively, on issues in the philosophy of science and the philosophy of education. The third main period corresponds roughly to his time at Harvard, from 1924 onward. It was during this time that he worked primarily on issues in metaphysics.

1. Whitehead's Chronology

A short chronology of the major events in Whitehead's life is as follows:

  • (1861) Born February 15 in Ramsgate, Isle of Thanet, Kent, England.
  • (1880) Enters Trinity College, Cambridge, with a scholarship in mathematics.
  • (1884) Elected to the Apostles, the elite discussion club founded by Tennyson in the 1820s; graduates with a B.A. in Mathematics; elected a Fellow in Mathematics at Trinity.
  • (1890) Meets Russell; marries Evelyn Wade.
  • (1903) Elected a Fellow of the Royal Society as a result of his work on universal algebra, symbolic logic and the foundations of mathematics.
  • (1910) Resigns from Cambridge and moves to London.
  • (1911) Appointed Lecturer at University College London.
  • (1914) Appointed Professor of Applied Mathematics at the Imperial College of Science and Technology.
  • (1922) Elected President of the Aristotelian Society.
  • (1924) Appointed Professor of Philosophy at Harvard University.
  • (1931) Elected a Fellow of the British Academy.
  • (1937) Retires from Harvard.
  • (1945) Awarded Order of Merit.
  • (1947) Dies December 30 in Cambridge, Massachusetts, USA.

The son of an Anglican clergyman, Whitehead graduated from Cambridge in 1884 and was elected a Fellow of Trinity College that same year. His marriage to Evelyn Wade six years later was largely a happy one and together they had a daughter and three sons, one of whom sadly died at birth. After moving to London, Whitehead served as president of the Aristotelian Society from 1922 to 1923. After moving to Harvard, he was elected to the British Academy in 1931. His moves to both London and Harvard were prompted in part by institutional regulations requiring mandatory retirement, although his resignation from Cambridge was also done partly in protest over how the University had chosen to discipline Andrew Forsyth, a friend and colleague whose affair with a married woman had become something of a local scandal.

As fellowship examiner for Bertrand Russell and academic supervisor for Willard Van Orman Quine, Whitehead exerted enormous influence on the development of twentieth-century philosophy. This is true even though his main philosophical doctrine – that the world is composed of deeply interdependent processes and events, rather than mostly independent material things or objects – turned out to be largely the opposite of Russell's doctrine of logical atomism.

More detailed information about Whitehead's life can be found in the comprehensive two-volume biography A.N. Whitehead: The Man and His Work (1985, 1990) by Victor Lowe and J.B. Schneewind. Paul Schilpp's The Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead (1941; 2nd edn 1951) also includes a short autobiographical essay, in addition to providing a comprehensive critical overview of Whitehead's thought and a detailed bibliography of his writings.

Other helpful introductions to Whitehead's work include Victor Lowe's Understanding Whitehead (1962), Nathaniel Lawrence's Whitehead's Philosophical Development (1956), Wolfe Mays' The Philosophy of Whitehead (1959) and Michael Epperson's Quantum Mechanics and the Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead (2004). For a chronology of Whitehead's major publications, readers are encouraged to consult the Primary Literature section of the Bibliography below.

Attempts to sum up Whitehead's life and influence are complicated by the fact that, following his death and in accordance with his instructions, all his papers were destroyed. As a result, there is no nachlass, except for papers retained by his colleagues and correspondents. Even so, it is instructive to recall the words of the late Associate Justice of the United States Supreme Court, Felix Frankfurter: “From knowledge gained through the years of the personalities who in our day have affected American university life, I have for some time been convinced that no single figure has had such a pervasive influence as the late Professor Alfred North Whitehead” (Letter, New York Times, January 8, 1948).

Today Whitehead's ideas continue to be felt in varying degrees in all four of the main areas in which he worked: logic and mathematics, the philosophy of science, the philosophy of education and metaphysics. A critical edition of his work is currently in the process of being prepared.

2. Whitehead on Mathematics and Logic

Whitehead began his academic career at Trinity College, Cambridge where, starting in 1884, he taught for a quarter of a century. In 1890, Bertrand Russell arrived as a student and during the 1890s the two men came into regular contact with one another. According to Russell, “Whitehead was extraordinarily perfect as a teacher. He took a personal interest in those with whom he had to deal and knew both their strong and their weak points. He would elicit from a pupil the best of which a pupil was capable. He was never repressive, or sarcastic, or superior, or any of the things that inferior teachers like to be. I think that in all the abler young men with whom he came in contact he inspired, as he did in me, a very real and lasting affection” (1967, 129–130).

By the early 1900s, both Whitehead and Russell had completed books on the foundations of mathematics. Whitehead's 1898 A Treatise on Universal Algebra had resulted in his election to the Royal Society. Russell's 1903 The Principles of Mathematics had expanded on several themes initially developed by Whitehead. Russell's book also represented a decisive break from the neo-Kantian approach to mathematics Russell had developed six years earlier in his Essay on the Foundations of Geometry. Since the research for a proposed second volume of Russell's Principles overlapped considerably with Whitehead's own research for a planned second volume of his Universal Algebra, the two men began collaboration on what eventually would become Principia Mathematica (1910, 1912, 1913). According to Whitehead, they initially expected the research to take about a year to complete. In the end, they worked together on the project for a decade.

Logicism, the theory that mathematics is in some important sense reducible to logic, consists of two main theses. The first is that all mathematical truths can be translated into logical truths or, in other words, that the vocabulary of mathematics constitutes a proper subset of the vocabulary of logic. The second is that all mathematical proofs can be recast as logical proofs or, in other words, that the theorems of mathematics constitute a proper subset of the theorems of logic.

Like Gottlob Frege, Whitehead and Russell immediately saw the advantages of such a reduction. Statements such as “There are at least two books” would be recast as “There is a book, x, and there is a book, y, and x is not identical to y.” Statements such as “There are exactly two books” would be recast as “There is a book, x, and there is a book, y, and x is not identical to y, and if there is a book, z, then z is identical to either x or y.” Number-theoretic operations could then be explained in terms of set-theoretic operations such as intersection, union, and difference. In Principia Mathematica, Whitehead and Russell were able to provide many detailed derivations of major theorems in set theory, finite and transfinite arithmetic, and elementary measure theory. They were also able to develop a sophisticated theory of logical relations and a unique method of defining the real numbers. Even so, the issue of whether set theory itself could be said to have been successfully reduced to logic remained controversial. (For additional discussion, see the entry on Principia Mathematica, as well as George and Velleman (2002).)

Following the completion of Principia, Whitehead and Russell began to go their separate ways. Perhaps inevitably, Russell's anti-war activities and Whitehead's loss of his youngest son during World War I led to something of a split between the two men. Nevertheless, the two remained on relatively good terms for the rest of their lives. To his credit, Russell comments in his Autobiography that when it came to their political differences, Whitehead “was more tolerant than I was, and it was much more my fault than his that these differences caused a diminution in the closeness of our friendship” (1967, 127).

3. Whitehead on the Philosophy of Science

In London, Whitehead turned his attention primarily to issues in the philosophy of science. Of particular note was his rejection of the idea that each physical object has a simple spatial or temporal location. Instead, Whitehead came to the conclusion that all objects should be understood as fields having both temporal and spatial extensions. For example, just as we cannot perceive a Euclidean point that is said to have position but no magnitude, or a line that is said to have length but no breadth, it is impossible, says Whitehead, to conceive of a simple spatial or temporal location. To think that we can do so involves what he called “The Fallacy of Misplaced Concreteness,” the error of mistaking the abstract for the concrete (1925, 64, 72).

As Whitehead describes his position,

among the primary elements of nature as apprehended in our immediate experience, there is no element whatever which possesses this character of simple location. … [Instead,] I hold that by a process of constructive abstraction we can arrive at abstractions which are the simply located bits of material, and at other abstractions which are the minds included in the scientific scheme. (1925, 72; cf. 1919, Pt 3)

Whitehead's basic thought was that we obtain the abstract idea of a spatial point by considering the limit of a real-life series of volumes extending over each other in much the same way that we might consider a nested series of Russian dolls or a nested series of pots and pans. However, it would be a mistake to think of a spatial point as being anything more than an abstraction; instead, real positions involve the entire series of extended volumes. As Whitehead puts it, “In a certain sense, everything is everywhere at all times. For every location involves an aspect of itself in every other location. Thus every spatio-temporal standpoint mirrors the world” (1925, 114).

According to Whitehead, every real-life object may then be understood as a similarly constructed series of events and processes. It is this latter idea that Whitehead systematically elaborates in his Process and Reality (1929c), concluding that it is process, rather than substance, that should be taken as the most fundamental metaphysical constituent of the world:

That ‘all things flow’ is the first vague generalization which the unsystematized, barely analysed, intuition of men has produced. … Without doubt, if we are to go back to that ultimate, integral experience, unwarped by the sophistications of theory, that experience whose elucidation is the final aim of philosophy, the flux of things is one ultimate generalization around which we must weave our philosophical system. (1929c, 317)

Underlying Whitehead's work was also the idea that, if philosophy is to be successful, it must explain the connection between our objective, scientific and logical descriptions of the world and the more everyday world of subjective experience. As Whitehead writes,

Nature is nothing else than the deliverance of sense-awareness. … Our knowledge of nature is an experience of activity (or passage). The things previously observed are active entities, the ‘events.’ They are chunks in the life of nature. (1920, 185)

For this reason it is one of Whitehead's core beliefs that “We must avoid vicious bifurcation” (1920, 185). In other words, we must avoid dividing the world into separate categories of mind and matter, or into nature as it is apprehended in awareness and nature as the cause of that awareness. As Whitehead explains,

The nature which is the fact apprehended in awareness holds within it the greenness of the trees, the song of the birds, the warmth of the sun, the hardness of the chairs, and the feel of the velvet. The nature which is the cause of awareness is the conjectured system of molecules and electrons which so affects the mind as to produce the awareness of apparent nature. (1920, 31)

Ultimately, says Whitehead, all experience is a part of nature: “We may not pick and choose. For us the red glow of the sunset should be as much part of nature as are the molecules and electric waves by which men of science would explain the phenomenon” (1920, 29; cf. 1929c, Pt 2, Ch. 9, sec. 2).

4. Whitehead on the Philosophy of Education

While in London, Whitehead became involved in many practical aspects of tertiary education, serving as Dean of the Faculty of Science at Imperial College and holding several other administrative posts. Many of his essays about education date from this time and appear in his book, The Aims of Education and Other Essays (1929a). It was also during this time that Whitehead published several of his less well-known books, including An Inquiry Concerning the Principles of Natural Knowledge (1919), The Concept of Nature (1920) and The Principle of Relativity (1922).

At its core, Whitehead's philosophy of education emphasizes the idea that a good life is most profitably thought of as an educated or civilized life, two terms which Whitehead often uses interchangeably. As we think, we live. Thus it is only as we improve our thoughts that we improve our lives. The result, says Whitehead, is that “There is only one subject matter for education, and that is Life in all its manifestations” (1929a, 10). This view in turn has corollaries for both the content of education and its method of delivery.

With regard to delivery, Whitehead emphasizes the importance of remembering that a “pupil's mind is a growing organism ... it is not a box to be ruthlessly packed with alien ideas” (1929a, 47). Instead, it is the purpose of education to stimulate and guide each student's self-development. It is not the job of the educator simply to insert into his students' minds little chunks of knowledge.

With regard to content, Whitehead holds that any adequate education must include a literary component, a scientific component and a technical component. The first includes, not just the study of language, but also the study of high achievement in human thought and writing. The second includes practice in the observation of natural phenomena as well as exposure to the testing of theories and of the presumed law-like connections we find in the natural world. The third focuses primarily on the “art of utilizing knowledge” (1929a, 77), especially in the production of goods but also in any area of so-called knowledge application. Although all three components are essential for a proper education, varying degrees of emphasis will be required, depending on a student's interests and abilities. (For additional discussion, see Johnson 1946.)

The result, says Whitehead, is that the commonly made distinction between technical education and liberal education “is fallacious. There can be no adequate technical education which is not liberal, and no liberal education which is not technical: that is, no education which does not impart both technique and intellectual vision” (1929a, 74). The good life requires, not just accomplishment, but also the stimulus to create, and participate in, an improved, more civilized society.

Whitehead's contrast here is with Plato, whose theory of education, Whitehead claims, focuses almost exclusively on the theoretical and the veridical at the expense of the practical, and which results only in commands, rather than in growing capacities of self-awareness and self-guidance. (Other scholars have sometimes chosen to differ.) In contrast, Whitehead sees education as necessarily encouraging the marriage of thought with action. As he puts it, “No man of science wants merely to know. He acquires knowledge to appease his passion for discovery” (1929a, 74). As a result, the “insistence in the Platonic culture on disinterested intellectual appreciation is a psychological error” (1929a, 73), an observation that Philip Jourdain concludes is “of the first importance” (1918, 244) for any successful theory of education.

5. Whitehead on Metaphysics

Facing mandatory retirement in London, and upon being offered an appointment at Harvard, Whitehead moved to the United States in 1924. Given his prior training in mathematics, it was sometimes joked that the first philosophy lectures he ever attended were those he himself delivered in his new role as Professor of Philosophy. As Russell comments, “In England, Whitehead was regarded only as a mathematician, and it was left to America to discover him as a philosopher” (1952, 93).

A year after his arrival, he delivered Harvard's prestigious Lowell Lectures. The lectures formed the basis for Science and the Modern World (1925). The 1927/28 Gifford Lectures at the University of Edinburgh followed shortly afterwards and resulted in the publication of Whitehead's most comprehensive (but difficult to penetrate) metaphysical work, Process and Reality (1929c). Together, his three books The Concept of Nature (1920), Science and the Modern World (1925) and Process and Reality (1929c) provide a relatively complete statement of Whitehead's mature metaphysical system.

Within this system, rather than assuming substance as the basic metaphysical category, Whitehead understands nature to be composed ultimately of events. Events include among their ingredients what we normally think of as objects. As Whitehead writes,

An object is an ingredient in the character of some event. In fact the character of an event is nothing but the objects which are ingredient in it and the ways in which those objects make their ingression into the event. Thus the theory of objects is the theory of the comparison of events. Events are only comparable because they body forth permanences. We are comparing objects in events whenever we can say, ‘There it is again.’ Objects are the elements in nature which can ‘be again.’ (1920, 143-4)

Thus, while “The most concrete fact capable of separate discrimination is the event” (1920, 189), for Whitehead objects, unlike events, “do not pass” (1920, 143).

Later, Whitehead introduces a new metaphysically primitive notion which he calls an actual occasion. For Whitehead, an actual occasion (or actual entity) is not an enduring substance, but a process of becoming. As Whitehead puts it, actual occasions are the “final real things of which the world is made up”, they are “drops of experience, complex and interdependent” (1929c, Pt 1, Ch. 2, sec. 1, p. 27).

As Donald Sherburne explains, “It is customary to compare an actual occasion with a Leibnizian monad, with the caveat that whereas a monad is windowless, an actual occasion is ‘all window.’ It is as though one were to take Aristotle's system of categories and ask what would result if the category of substance were displaced from its preeminence by the category of relation …” (Sherburne 1995, 852). As Whitehead himself tells us, his “philosophy of organism is the inversion of Kant's philosophy … For Kant, the world emerges from the subject; for the philosophy of organism, the subject emerges from the world” (quoted in Sherburne 1995, 852).

Significantly, many of these key aspects of Whitehead's metaphysics run counter to the traditional view of material substance: “There persists,” says Whitehead, a

fixed scientific cosmology which presupposes the ultimate fact of an irreducible brute matter, or material, spread through space in a flux of configurations. In itself such a material is senseless, valueless, purposeless. It just does what it does do, following a fixed routine imposed by external relations which do not spring from the nature of its being. It is this assumption that I call ‘scientific materialism.’ Also it is an assumption which I shall challenge as being entirely unsuited to the scientific situation at which we have now arrived. (1925, 22)

The assumption of scientific materialism is effective in many contexts, says Whitehead, only because it directs our attention to a certain class of problems that lend themselves to analysis within this framework. However, scientific materialism is less successful when addressing issues of teleology (or purpose) and when trying to develop a comprehensive, integrated picture of the universe as a whole.

According to Whitehead, recognition that the world is organic rather than materialistic is essential for anyone wanting to develop a comprehensive account of nature, and this change in viewpoint can result as easily from attempts to understand human psychology and teleology as from attempts to understand modern physics. Says Whitehead, “Mathematical physics presumes in the first place an electromagnetic field of activity pervading space and time. The laws which condition this field are nothing else than the conditions observed by the general activity of the flux of the world, as it individualises itself in the events” (1925, 190). The result is that nature is no longer thought to be simply atoms in the void, but instead “a structure of evolving processes. The reality is the process” (1925, 90).

6. Whitehead's Influence

Unlike the logical apparatus Whitehead developed with Russell, Whitehead's attempt to provide a metaphysical unification of space, time, matter, events and teleology has been less than enthusiastically embraced by members of the broader philosophical community. In part, this may be because of the connections Whitehead saw between his metaphysics and traditional theism. According to Whitehead, religion is concerned with permanence amid change, and can be found in the ordering we find within nature, something he sometimes calls the “primordial nature of God” (1929c, 31, 32; cf. Pt 5, Ch. 2, secs 1-7).

As early as his writing of Religion in the Making (1926), Whitehead had been interested in promoting the idea that religion helps make sense of permanence amid change. Despite the fact that the world is composed of events and processes (rather than of unchanging objects), on Whitehead's view God still provides the world with a kind of permanence. Thinkers who have been influenced by this aspect of Whitehead's work include John B. Cobb Jr, Charles Hartshorne, Norman Pittenger and Marjorie Suchocki.

Whitehead's emphasis on change has also led some theologians to conclude that, rather than being seen as the traditional unmoved mover, God should be seen as being influenced as much by the world as the world is influenced by God. As a result of books such as Cobb's Is It Too Late? A Theology of Ecology (1971), some contemporary theories of ecology have also been influenced by Whitehead's ideas.

Thus, although not especially influential among many Anglo-American secular philosophers, Whitehead's metaphysical ideas continue to have influence among some theologians and philosophers of religion.

Bibliography

Primary Literature

A comprehensive list of Whitehead's publications appears in Paul Schilpp's The Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead (1941; 2nd edn 1951).

His most influential writings include the following:

  • 1898, A Treatise on Universal Algebra, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • 1902, “On Cardinal Numbers,” American Journal of Mathematics, 24: 367–394.
  • 1906a, The Axioms of Projective Geometry, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • 1906b, “On Mathematical Concepts of the Material World,” Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society of London, Series A, 205 (1906): 465–525.
  • 1907, The Axioms of Descriptive Geometry, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • 1910, 1912, 1913 (with Bertrand Russell), Principia Mathematica, 3 vols, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press; 2nd edn, 1925 (Vol. 1), 1927 (Vols 2, 3); abridged as Principia Mathematica to *56, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1962.
  • 1911, An Introduction to Mathematics, London: Williams and Norgate.
  • 1917, The Organisation of Thought, Educational and Scientific, London: Williams & Norgate.
  • 1919, An Enquiry concerning the Principles of Natural Knowledge, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • 1920, The Concept of Nature, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press; reissued Mineola, NY: Dover Publications, Inc., 2004.
  • 1922, The Principle of Relativity with Applications to Physical Science, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • 1925, Science and the Modern World, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1926.
  • 1926, Religion in the Making, New York: Macmillan.
  • 1927, Symbolism, Its Meaning and Effect, New York: Macmillan.
  • 1929a, The Aims of Education and Other Essays, New York: The Macmillan Company; repr. 1959.
  • 1929b, The Function of Reason, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • 1929c, Process and Reality, New York: Macmillan.
  • 1933, Adventures of Ideas, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press; New York: Macmillan.
  • 1934, Nature and Life, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • 1938, Modes of Thought, New York: Macmillan.
  • 1947a, Essays in Science and Philosophy, New York: Philosophical Library.
  • 1947b, The Wit and Wisdom of Whitehead, A.H. Johnson (ed.), Boston: Beacon Press.
  • 1953, A.N. Whitehead: An Anthology, F.S.C. Northrop and M.W. Gross (eds.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press; New York: Macmillan.

Secondary Literature

  • Alcantara, Jean-Pascal, 2011, “On Internal Relations in Leibniz, British Neo-realism, and Whitehead,” Logique et Analyse, 54: 173–209.
  • Allan, George, 2010, “In Defense of Secularizing Whitehead,” Process Studies, 39: 319–333.
  • Armour, Leslie, 2010, “Looking for Whitehead,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 18: 925–939.
  • Athearn, Daniel, 2011, “Physics and Whitehead: An Alternative Approach,” Process Studies, 40: 80–90.
  • Basile, Pierfrancesco, 2009, Leibniz, Whitehead and the Metaphysics of Causation, Basingstoke: Palgrave Macmillan.
  • Bostock, David, 2010, “Whitehead and Russell on Points,” Philosophia Mathematica, 18: 1–52.
  • Bright, Laurence, 1958, Whitehead's Philosophy of Physics, London: Sheed and Ward.
  • Cobb, John B., 1965, A Christian Natural Theology, Based on the Thought of Alfred North Whitehead, Philadelphia: Westminster Press.
  • –––, 1971, Is It Too Late? A Theology of Ecology, Beverly Hills, CA: Bruce.
  • Connelly, Robert Joseph, 1981, Whitehead vs Hartshorne, Washington, D.C.: University Press of America.
  • Desmet, Ronny, 2008, “How did Whitehead become Einstein's Antagonist? On Poincaré and Whitehead,” Process Studies, 37: 5–23.
  • –––, 2010, “Principia Mathematica Centenary,” Process Studies, 39: 225–263.
  • ––– and Bogdan Rusu, 2012, “Whitehead, Russell, and Moore: Three Analytic Philosophers,” Process Studies, 41: 214–234.
  • ––– and Michel Weber, 2010, Whitehead: The Algebra of Metaphysics, Louvain-la-Neuve, Belgium: Les Éditions Chromatika.
  • Dunkel, Harold Baker, 1965, Whitehead on Education, Columbus: Ohio State University Press.
  • Eastman, Timothy E., and Hank Keeton (eds.), 2004, Physics and Whitehead: Quantum, Process and Experience, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Emmet, Dorothy Mary, 1932, Whitehead's Philosophy of Organism, London: Macmillan; 2nd edn, 1966.
  • Epperson, Michael, 2004, Quantum Mechanics and the Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead, New York: Fordham University Press.
  • Gabbay, Dov M., and John Woods (eds.), 2009, Handbook of the History of Logic: Volume 5—Logic From Russell to Church, Amsterdam: Elsevier/North Holland.
  • George, Alexander and Daniel J. Velleman, 2002, Philosophy of Mathematics, Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
  • Griffin, Nicholas, and Bernard Linsky (eds.), 2013, The Palgrave Centenary Companion to Principia Mathematica, London: Palgrave Macmillan.
  • Griffin, Nicholas, and Bernard Linsky and Kenneth Blackwell (eds.), 2011, Principia Mathematica at 100, Hamilton, ON: Bertrand Russell Research Centre; also published as Special Issue vol. 31, no. 1 of Russell: The Journal of Bertrand Russell Studies.
  • Hall, David, 1973, The Civilization of Experience, New York: Fordham University Press.
  • Henning, Brian G., Adam Scarfe, and Dorion Sagan (eds.), 2013, Beyond Mechanism, Lanham: Lexington Books.
  • Holmgren, Christine and Leemon McHenry, 2012, “Quine and Whitehead on Ontological Reduction: Properties Reconsidered,” Process Studies, 41: 261–286.
  • Hurtubise, Denis, 2001, “One, Two, or Three Concepts of God in Alfred North Whitehead's Process and Reality?” Process Studies, 30: 78–100.
  • Hartshorne, Charles, 1972, Whitehead's Philosophy: Selected Essays, 1935-1970, Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press.
  • Irvine, A.D. (ed.), 2009, Philosophy of Mathematics, Amsterdam: Elsevier/North Holland.
  • Johnson, A.H., 1946, “Whitehead's Discussion of Education,” Education, 66 (10): 1–19.
  • –––, 1952, Whitehead's Theory of Reality, Boston: Beacon Press.
  • –––, 1958, Whitehead's Philosophy of Civilization, Boston: Beacon Press.
  • –––, 1969, “Whitehead as Teacher and Philosopher,” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 29: 351–376.
  • –––, 1973, Experiential Realism, London: George Allen and Unwin.
  • Jourdain, Philip E.B., 1918, Review of A.N. Whitehead's The Organisation of Thought, Educational and Scientific, Mind, 27: 244–247.
  • Kline, George Louis, 1963, Alfred North Whitehead, Englewood Cliffs, N.J.: Prentice-Hall.
  • Lango, John W., 1972, Whitehead's Ontology, Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Lawrence, Nathaniel Morris, 1956, Whitehead's Philosophical Development, Berkeley: University of California Press.
  • Leclerc, Ivor, 1958, Whitehead's Metaphysics: An Introductory Exposition, London: Allen and Unwin; New York: Macmillan.
  • Leclercq, Bruno, 2011, “Looking for New Mathematical Concepts for the Material World: Whitehead's Investigations into Formal Ontology,” Logique et Analyse, 54: 211–224.
  • Lowe, Victor, 1962, Understanding Whitehead, Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press.
  • –––, 1985, A.N. Whitehead: The Man and His Work, Vol. 1: 1861–1910, Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press.
  • ––– and Schneewind, J.B., 1990, A.N. Whitehead: The Man and His Work, Vol. 2: 1910–1947, Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press.
  • Lucas, George R., 1989, The Rehabilitation of Whitehead, Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Lutskanov, Rosen, 2011, “Whitehead's Early Philosophy of Mathematics and the Development of Formalism,” Logique et Analyse, 54: 161–172.
  • Mays, Wolfgang, 1959, The Philosophy of Whitehead, London: Allen & Unwin.
  • –––, 1977, Whitehead's Philosophy of Science and Metaphysics: An Introduction to his Thought, The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • Mesle, C. Robert, 2008, Process-Relational Philosophy: An Introduction to Alfred North Whitehead, Conshohocken, PA: Templeton Foundation Press.
  • Nobo, Jorge Luis, 1986, Whitehead's Metaphysics of Extension and Solidarity, Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Onwuegbusi, Martin O., 2010, “The Concept of the Person in Whitehead's Process Metaphysics,” Philosophia, 39: 159–176.
  • –––, 2013, “God in Whitehead's Process Metaphysics,” Philosophia, 14: 247–262.
  • Palter, Robert M., 1960, Whitehead's Philosophy of Science, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Pittenger, W. Norman, 1969, Alfred North Whitehead, Richmond: John Knox Press.
  • Pols, Edward, 1967, Whitehead's Metaphysics, Carbondale: Southern Illinois University Press.
  • Price, Lucien (ed.), 1954, Dialogues of Alfred North Whitehead, Boston: Little, Brown.
  • Quine, Willard Van Orman, 1941, “Whitehead and the Rise of Modern Logic,” in Paul Arthur Schilpp (ed.), The Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead, La Salle: Open Court, 125–164.
  • Riche, Jacques, 2011, “Logic in Whitehead's Universal Algebra,” Logique et Analyse, 54: 135–159.
  • Riffert, Franz, 2012, “Analytic Philosophy, Whitehead, and Theory Construction,” Process Studies, 41: 235–260.
  • Ross, Stephen David, 1983, Perspective in Whitehead's Metaphysics, Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Russell, Bertrand, 1903, The Principles of Mathematics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 1948, “Whitehead and Principia Mathematica,” Mind, 57: 137–138.
  • –––, 1952, “Alfred North Whitehead,” The Listener, 48 (July): 51-52; revised and repr. in Bertrand Russell, Portraits From Memory, New York: Simon and Schuster, 1956, 99-104; and repr. in Bertrand Russell, The Autobiography of Bertrand Russell, Vol. 1, London: George Allen and Unwin, 1967, 127-130.
  • –––, 1967–1969, The Autobiography of Bertrand Russell, 3 vols, London: George Allen and Unwin; Boston: Little Brown and Company (Vols 1 and 2), New York: Simon and Schuster (Vol. 3).
  • –––, 1988, Essays on Language, Mind and Matter, 1919–26, Collected Papers of Bertrand Russell, Volume 9, London: Unwin Hyman.
  • –––, 1997, Last Philosophical Testament, 1943–68, Collected Papers of Bertrand Russell, Volume 11, London and New York: Routledge.
  • Schilpp, Paul Arthur (ed.), 1941, The Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead, La Salle: Open Court; 2nd edn, 1951.
  • Shapiro, Stewart (ed.), 2005, The Oxford Handbook of Philosophy of Mathematics and Logic, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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  • –––, 1966, A Key to Whitehead's Process and Reality, New York: Macmillan.
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Acknowledgments

Thanks are due to Kenneth Blackwell, Fred Kroon, Jim Robinson and several anonymous referees for their helpful comments on earlier versions of this material.


Copyright © 2015 by
Andrew David Irvine <andrew.irvine@ubc.ca>

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