Notes to Greek Sources in Arabic and Islamic Philosophy

1. Cognate words are faylasuf and its plural falasifa. Sa‘id al-Andalusi (d. 1070) gives the following account: “The language of the Greeks (Yunaniyun) is called Greek (ighriqiya). It is one of the richest and most important languages in the world. As to religion, the Greeks are Sabians, that is, worshippers of the stars and idolaters. Their scholars used to be called philosophers (falasifa). Philosopher (faylasuf) means in Greek ‘friend of wisdom’. The Greek philosophers belong to the highest class of human beings and to the greatest scholars, since they showed a genuine interest in all branches of wisdom, mathematics, logic, natural science and metaphyiscs, as well as economics and politics”: trans. Rosenthal (1975), 39.

2. So Nasr (1996a) and (1996b), protesting against those who conceive of Islamic philosophy as “simply an extension of Greek philosophy” (31) and coming to the conclusion that “Islamic philosophy is Islamic not only by virtue of the fact that it was cultivated in the Islamic world by Muslims but because it derives its principles, inspiration and many of the questions with which it has been concerned from the sources of Islamic revelation” (27). According to Nasr, it is “essentially a philosophical hermeneutics of the Sacred Text while making use of the rich philosophical heritage of antiquity” (37). In the same vein of Nasr, see now Jambet (2011). The standard work on the notions of science (‘ilm) and wisdom (hikma) in Islam is Rosenthal (1970).

3. This position is best exemplified by Walzer (1950) and (1970), 23: “Sa naissance a été le résultat de circonstances historiques très spéciales, à savoir la conquête musulmane des provinces intellectuellement plus avancées de l’Empire romain d’Orient d’une part, la situation politique et religieuse au premier siècle du califat abbasside d’autre part. Elle est, de ce fait, l’importation d’une tradition étrangère et elle a dû lutter pour être reconnue et intégrée. […] Cependant, la philosophie grecque n’a pas été imposée aux musulmans, et les traductions furent entreprises parce que les musulmans avaient spontanément décidé d’intégrer à la littérature arabe cet héritage étranger”. See also Rosenthal (1975).

4. This approach is often preferred in the scholarship: see Badawi (1968); an extremely useful monograph by Peters (1968), deals specifically with the translations of Aristotle, and the outstanding Dictionnaire des Philosophes Antiques directed by R. Goulet (CNRS, Paris) deals systematically with the Arabic tradition of the writings of the philosophers listed, often providing an up-to-date account of the new findings.

5. See Endress (2004), 227–28, describing Averroes' exhaltation of Aristotle within the context of the project “to vindicate the work of philosophy (…) as a rule of reason governing all of society. Relying on Aristotle to carry his point through all of the rational sciences, this meant to expound the truth on the basis of all the works of Aristotle which had been transmitted”. A survey of Aristotle's works available in Arabic, following the systematic order of the Aristotelian corpus, is provided by Geoffroy (2011).

6. Together with the grammatical tradition: for instance, the Τέχνη γραμματική by Dionysius Thrax was translated into Syriac within AD 580. See Contini (2001).

7. On the Aristotelian logical tradition in Syriac see Baumstark (1900) and (1905), Furlani (1916); (1922); (1921–22); (1922a); (1922b); (1923a); (1923b); (1928); (1933), and Georr (1948), to be corrected in the light of Brock (1993) and Hugonnard-Roche (2004), 60–62. In addition to Aristotle's logical corpus and to Porphyry's Isagoge, also other works by Porphyry have been translated into Syriac: at least a part of the Philosophical History (see below note 49), and according to Altheim and Stiehl (1962) also parts of the writing Against the Christians. There are Syriac translations also of a Pythagorean collection of sayings ascribed to Pythagoras' wife Theano (see Possekel [1998]) as well as of the so-called ‘Sayings’ of the pseudo-Menander (see Bettiolo 2003); other translations of moral writings include some Plutarch and Themistius: see Brock (2003) and the overview by Hugonnard-Roche (2011), raising the question of the readership of these translations.

8. On the Syriac and Arabic tradition of the De Mundo see the survey by Raven (2003).

9. Endress (2002), 43, referring also to previous literature.

10. Up-to-date survey of Sergius' translations and personal works in Hugonnard-Roche (2004), 125–32.

11. On the Syriac translations of mathematical, astronomical and scientific works in general see Hugonnard-Roche (2001), 36–41; on the translations in the field of logic, see Hugonnard-Roche (2004); on the different stages of the translations from Greek into Syriac and the increasing importance of philosophy with respect to rhetoric, see Hugonnard-Roche (2011); for a survey, see Fiori (2011). In particular on the Syriac versions of Porphyry's Isagoge, see Brock (1993) and Hugonnard-Roche (2012).

12. According to Gutas (2006), 97 “These letters (…) derive primarily from Byzantine manuals of administration and warfare (the Tactica) with accretions from Greek material from the classical and Hellenistic periods, and from so-called Hermetic material deriving from sundry sources”. The pseudo-Aristotelian letters have been edited by Maróth (2006), review by Gutas (2009).

13. Ryan and Schmitt (1982). For an up-to-date status quaestionis see Zonta (2003), 648–51.

14. According to the 12th century historian Sa‘id al-Andalusi, Ibn al-Muqaffa‘ was the first to deal with logic: see Kraus (1934).

15. K. al-Fihrist, 248.27 Flügel = 309.9 Tajaddud and 249.4 Flügel = 309.14 Tajaddud. This work is extant and edited: Danish Pazuh (1978). The attribution either to Ibn al-Muqaffa‘ or to his son is categorically ruled out by Vallat (2011), 69. Be this as it may, Porphyry's Isagoge was known to some extent even before its translation from Syriac into Arabic by Abu ‘Uthman al-Dimashqi (see below, note 79), because it is echoed by the title of an Epistle by al-Kindi On the Five Predicables, now lost (256.16 Flügel = 313.22 Tajaddud).

16. Danish Pazuh (1978), cf. Elamrani Jamal (1989), 510.

17. Brock (1999); this translation might be hinted at in the K. al-Fihrist (249.18 Flügel = 309.28 Tajaddud); see Elamrani Jamal (1989), 525 and Gutas (1998), 61. Brock (1999) highlights the role of Aristotelian logic in the inter-faith controversy. The role of Greek philosophy and especially of Aristotelian logic in the formation of Muslim theology (Kalam) is matter of a prolonged debate in scholarship: see Wolfson (1976), van Ess (1976), Frank (1979) and (1992). On Kalam as such see the survey by Griffel (2011); the reference work on the formative period of Muslim theology is van Ess (1991–97). On the attitude of the Muslim theologians toward philosophy see the overview by Kukkonen (2011).

18. See below, note 63.

19. K. al-Fihrist, 244.5–6 Flügel = 304.27 Tajaddud (where however Sallam and al-Abrash appear as two people).

20. Gutas (1998), 78–79 outlines his education, which was “imbued with the Zoroastrian Sasanian imperial ideology first applied to the Islamic empire by al-Mansur”, his “reliance on astrology and hence his deep study of the ancient books”, both leading him to view “the ‘Abbasid dynasty as the inheritors of the past empires in the area”. Gutas points also to his way of understanding the leadership, after his return to Baghdad and the conquest of the power, to the cost of the murder of the caliph (and his brother) al-Amin: “al-Ma’mun's new policy was based on an absolutist interpretation of Islam, with the Caliph as the ultimate arbiter of dogma”. See also Cooperson (2005).

21. On this development, see the all-embracing analysis by Endress (1987) and (1992), summarized as follows in Endress (1997a), 44–45: “An element of personal competition and resulting animosity between the intellectual circles of rationalist theologians (…), of traditionists (…) and of the rising community of scientists—the vanguard of intellectual innovation—was the obvious result of the official and semi-official encouragement of the Hellenistic movement. The leaders of the administration furthered and financed translations of scientific (mainly astronomical and mathematical) and medical works on a large scale. Foremost was the ‘Abbasid caliph: the court library founded by Harun al-Rashid was expanded by his son al-Ma’mun and devoted exclusively to the rational sciences with a continuing predominance of astronomy: the Bayt al-hikma. (…) The medium of most of this activity was Arabic: a language in the course of being standardized by normative grammar, and being instrumentalized as the code of communication in a centralized theocratic state”.

22. The scientific nature of the works studied and translated within the context of the Bayt al-hikma is accounted for in detail by Endress (1987), 423–9. See also Di Branco (2012).

23. See, with different emphasis on the scope and nature of the Bayt al-hikma, Balty-Guesdon (1992), Micheau (1997), Gutas (1998), 58–60, and Di Branco (2012).

24. See Endress (1997a) and, on al-Kindi, Adamson (2006) and (2011).

25. Ed. by Abu Rida (1950) and Rashed-Jolivet (1999); English trans. Ivry (1974).

26. K. al-Fihrist, 251.27–28 Flügel = 312.14 Tajaddud. On Kindi's role in the creation of the pseudo-Aristotelian texts out of Neoplatonic materials, see D'Ancona (2001), (2011b).

27. The K. al-Fihrist, 246.15–16 Flügel = 306.29–307.1 Tajaddud, claims that the Timaeus had been translated by Ibn al-Bitriq (“the son of the Patrikios”, a Byzantine title: see Endress 1997a, 55), one of the translators whose works bear the typical features of the “circle of al-Kindi”. See on him Dunlop (1959). On the knowledge of the Timaeus in the Arabic-speaking world see the outstanding study by Arnzen (2012).

28. Either the dialogue itself or a doxographical report concerning the speeches about love lies in the background of Kindi's own Epistle The Agreement of the Philosophers regarding the signs of passionate love, which is lost to us, but is quoted by the 9th century physician Ibn Bakhtishu: see Klein-Franke (1973) and Gutas (1988a).

29. The Myth of Er of Republic X, 614 A - 621 D is known to al-Kindi. Various explanations have been advanced for this: see Furlani (1922c), Walzer (1937), Genequand (1987–88) and Endress (1994). The Myth of Gyges of Republic II, 359 D - 360 B features in the Epistles of the Brethren of Purity: see Baffioni (2001); another passage from the Republic has been discovered by Reisman (2004), and paraphrases of selected passages have been found by Arberry (1955). For a general survey on the Arabic Plato see Arnzen (2009), (2011), (2012), and Gutas (2012).

30. It has been copied in the margins of a manuscript housed in Leiden, which is at one and the same time also the only testimony of Averroes' Great Commentary on the Metaphysics and of the other versions of the Arabic Metaphysics. This unique document is available in the outstanding edition and study by Bouyges (1938–48, available also online at http://www.greekintoarabic.eu). For a survey on the translations of Aristotle's Metaphysics see Martin (1989) and Martini Bonadeo (2003), with reference to previous literature. The importance of the Metaphysics in the circle of al-Kindi is apparent not only from Kindi's own works like the First Philosophy (see above, note 25), but also from the Concise Exposition of Aristotle's Metaphysics by the astronomer and mathematician Thabit ibn Qurra (d. 901). A prominent figure of the circle of al-Kindi, Thabit ibn Qurra was deeply involved also in Aristotelian logic and metaphysics, which he interpreted in Neoplatonic vein: see Reisman (2011) and the edition and translation of the Concise Exposition of Aristotle's Metaphysics by Reisman - Bertolacci (2009).

31. Eustathius, in all likelihood of Byzantine origin; he is also credited with the translation of Olympiodorus' commentary on the De Gen. corr., see below, note 47.

32. Translated by Ibn al-Bitriq: see Endress (1997a), 58.

33. The translation of the Soph. El. into Syriac is attributed to ‘Abd al-Masih ibn Na‘ima al-Himsi: K. al-Fihrist 249.26–28 Flügel = 310.9–10 Tajaddud, mentioning also the subsequent translation into Arabic by Ibn Bakus al-‘Ushari; the manuscript of the so-called “Organon of Baghdad” attributes one of the three Arabic translations of the Soph. El. to Ibn Na‘ima: see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 526–8.

34. As mentioned in the K. al-Fihrist, 250.28 Flügel = 311.12 Tajaddud, the De Caelo has been translated by Ibn al-Bitriq. The translation is extant and edited: Badawi (1961); however, the text as it has come down to us is not Ibn al-Bitriq's translation itself, but a revision of it: see Endress (1966) and (1995a), 47–8; Hugonnard-Roche (2003a).

35. Ibn al-Bitriq translated also the Meteorologica. This translation is extant and edited: Schoonheim (2000); see also Schoonheim (2003).

36. The Arabic translation of De Gen. an. (mentioned under the general heading of K. al-Hayawan) is attributed to Ibn al-Bitriq in the K. al-Fihrist, 251.26 Flügel = 312.8 Tajaddud; the translation is extant and edited: Brugman - Drossaart Lulofs (1971); see Kruk (2003), 329, who challenges Ibn al-Bitriq's authorship. The translation of the De Part. an. also is attributed to Ibn al-Bitriq under the same heading (K. al-Fihrist, see above in this note); the translation is extant: Kruk (1979); see also Kruk (2003).

37. Daiber (1997), 36–41 and R. E. Hansberger, The Transmission of Aristotle's Parva Naturalia in Arabic (forthcoming).

38. Editio princeps: Dieterici (1882); another edition has been provided by Badawi (1955a).

39. See the entry on the Theology of Aristotle for further details; survey and bibliography in Aouad (1989b), Adamson (2003) and D’Ancona (2003), (2011a).

40. Editio princeps: Bardenhewer (1888); another edition has been provided by Badawi (1955b); for the status quaestionis see D’Ancona-Taylor (2003).

41. K. al-Fihrist, 251.4 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud; this translation is not extant; for the extant fragments of the later translation by Abu Bishr Matta ibn Yunus see below, note 111.

42. Daiber (1980), 4. On the life and works of Qusta ibn Luqa see Gabrieli (1912).

43. The translator was the Christian ‘Abd al-Masih ibn Na‘ima al-Himsi, allegedly also the translator of the Soph. El. (see above, note 33); he is credited also with the translation of part of the commentary on the Physics by John Philoponus (see below, note 45).

44. See above, note 39.

45. K. al-Fihrist, 250.18 Flügel = 311.1 Tajaddud; see Endress (1977), 36–37; Lettinck (1994), 5–6 and Giannakis (2002–3), (2011); see also Hasnaoui (1994). Extracts from the commentary on the Physics are found in the so-called "Physics of Baghdad", a manuscript housed in Leiden which contains the Arabic version of Aristotle's Physics accompanied by notes taken from various commentaries, among which Philoponus'. On the doctrines held in it and witnessed in the "Physics of Baghdad" see Davidson (1979), Zimmermann (1987) and Giannakis (1992). Up-to-date analysis of the primary data and of the bibliography by Gannagé (2012), 518–31, containing also an in-depth account of the influence of Philoponus' physical theories on Muslim thought.

46. On the influence of Philoponus' arguments against eternalism see Davidson (1987), Gannagé (2012), 546–9.

47. K. al-Fihrist, 251.5 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud; see Rashed (2003), 312.

48. Translated by Qusta ibn Luqa. See Daiber (1980), (1994) and Gutas (1994). For an up-to-date survey on this literature and its circulation see Strohmaier (2011). The link between the atomistic views held by Mu‘tazilite theology and Greek atomism was in all likelihood the doxographical literature on the ancient physical doctrines; however, the details of this transmission are matter of debate: see Pines (1936), Baffioni (1982), Dhanani (1994) and Sabra (2006); see also the overview by Baffioni (2011).

49. Rudolph (1989). On the doxographical and gnomological literature see Rosenthal (1937) and (1941), Gutas (1975) and (1981), Daiber (1994), De Smet (1998), Cottrell (2008) and, for an overview of the problems, D'Ancona (2011c), 1059. On the Siwan al-hikma (Repository of Wisdom), one of the most important pieces of the doxographical literature in Arabic, see Al-Qadi (1981). In recent scholarship Ammonius son of Hermeias, the Neoplatonic commentator of Aristotle active in 6th century Alexandria, has been credited with decisive influence on Arabic philosophy (especially al-Farabi and Avicenna) on two counts: the doctrine of the harmony between Plato and Aristotle, and the understanding of the scope of Aristotle's Metaphysics: see Wisnowsly (2003), 21–141 and Bertolacci (2006), 65–95. In the entry on Aristotle, the K. al-Fihrist mentions Ammonius' commentaries on the Categories (248.21 Flügel = 309.5 Tajaddud) and on the Topics (249.24–25 Flügel = 310.7 Tajaddud); in the entry on Ammonius, three writings by him are mentioned, which lie in the background of the influence attributed to him in the studies mentioned above. For a note of caution, one may see D'Ancona (2008).

50. Bergsträsser (1925) and (1932). Up-to-date account of Galen's works in the Arabic-speaking world by Boudon (2000), 458–60. For an overview of the Arabic circulation of the textbooks of medical instruction in Greek (mostly based on Galen), see Biesterfeldt (2011a); for a survey on medicine and philosophy in the Arabic-speaking world, see Biesterfeldt (2011b).

51. K. al-Fihrist, 246.15–16 Flügel = 306.29–307.1 Tajaddud. On the knowledge of Plato in the Arabic-speaking world see Rosenthal (1940), Walzer (1960), Klein-Franke (1973), Gutas (2012), Arnzen (2012).

52. K. al-Fihrist, 246.5–6 Flügel = 306.20 Tajaddud.

53. K. al-Fihrist, 246.5 Flügel = 306.20 Tajaddud.

54. K. al-Fihrist, 246.11–12 Flügel = 306.25–26 Tajaddud.

55. K. al-Fihrist, 248.20 Flügel = 309.4 Tajaddud. However, the manuscript which contains the translation attributes it to Ishaq; see Hugonnard-Roche (1993). The translation is extant and edited: Badawi (1980); see Elamrani-Jamal (1989), 510–12.

56. K. al-Fihrist, 249.1 Flügel = 309.12 Tajaddud. The translation is extant and edited: Badawi (1980); see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 513–15.

57. K. al-Fihrist, 249.6 Flügel = 309.17 Tajaddud; this Tayadurus has been identified with Tadhari ibn Basil Akhi Istifan, a translator of the circle of Hunayn: see Lameer (1994), 4. The Arabic translation is extant: Badawi (1980); see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 516–20.

58. K. al-Fihrist, 249.11–12 Flügel = 309.23 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 520–1 and Elamrani-Jamal (1989), 521–4. This translation, lost to us, provided the basis for the Arabic version by Abu Bishr Matta ibn Yunus (see below, note 94).

59. K. al-Fihrist, 249.15 Flügel = 309.27 Tajaddud. Later on (249.24–25 Flügel = 310.7 Tajaddud) we are told that Ishaq translated "what Ammonius and Alexander have commented upon": see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 524 and Elamrani Jamal (1989), 525. A translation into Arabic of the Syriac version was made by Yahya ibn ‘Adi (see below, note 102).

60. On this physician and translator see Endress (1995b).

61. K. al-Fihrist, 249.16 Flügel = 309.27–28 Tajaddud. The translation is extant: Badawi (1980); see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 524 and Elamrani Jamal (1989), 525.

62. K. al-Fihrist, 250.1 Flügel = 310.13 Tajaddud; a translation by Ibrahim ibn ‘Abd Allah is also recorded (250.2 Flügel = 310.13 Tajaddud).

63. Lyons (1982); see Aouad (1989c), 455–9 and Watt-Aouad (2003), 219–23; see also above, note 18 and below, note 105.

64. As witnessed in the manuscript Leiden, Bibl. der Rijksuniversiteit, or. 583, which contains the translation (edited: Badawi 1984); a translation, perhaps only of books IV–V, is attributed to Abu ‘Uthman al-Dimashqi in the K. al-Fihrist, 250.14 Flügel = 310.25 Tajaddud. See Lettinck (1994), 3–6 and (2002); Giannakis (2003).

65. K. al-Fihrist, 250.28–29 Flügel = 311.12 Tajaddud); see Hugonnard-Roche (2003), 284–86.

66. K. al-Fihrist, 251.3 Flügel = 311.17 Tajaddud.

67. There are hints that it was Ishaq's translation which was translated into Latin by Gerard of Cremona in the 12th century: see Serra (1973) and (1997); Rashed (2003), 304–5.

68. K. al-Fihrist, 251.11–18 Flügel = 311.24–312.3 Tajaddud. An Arabic translation of the De Anima is edited: Badawi (1954) and Al-Ahwani (1962); see Ivry (2001) and Elamrani Jamal (2003), 346–58.

69. K. al-Fihrist, 251.26 Flügel = 312.12 Tajaddud. Books Alpha Meizon, Gamma, Theta and Iota of this translation have come down to us thanks to Averroes' Great Commentary; for this translation and the other translations of separate books of the Metaphysics (especially Lambda), see Martin (1989), 531–32 and Martini Bonadeo (2003), 262.

70. K. al-Fihrist, 252.2 Flügel = 312.19 Tajaddud; the translation is edited: Badawi (1978); see Zonta (2003), 192–3.

71. Partly available to us through an ethical treatise by Miskawayh (d. 1030): see Cacouros (2003), 511–13 and 537–42.

72. K. al-Fihrist, 252.5–11 Flügel = 312.21–26 Tajaddud. For the discussion of the authorship of the translation see Alon (1985) and Gutas (2010), 84–9. The De Causis plantarum and in part the De Sensu et sensato were translated by Ibn Bakkus, one of the translators associated with Hunayn's circle. On the Arabic tradition of Theophrastus' works see Daiber (1985), Gutas (1985), (1992), (2010), Crubellier (1992); on the indirect knowledge of Theophrastus through Themistius' paraphrases, see Gutas (1999).

73. Drossaart-Lulofs (1965). See below, note 109, for the testimony about the Arabic version from this Syriac translation.

74. Kraus-Walzer (1951); on the authorship of the translation, which is attributed to Hunayn ibn Ishaq in the manuscript sources, see ibid., 18–21.

75. K. al-Fihrist, 251.28 Flügel = 312.14–15 Tajaddud (it is not clear if this information refers to Book Lambda itself or to Alexander's commentary on it); this version is lost to us.

76. The Arabic version is lost, but the Hebrew version, which has come down to us, mentions Ishaq ibn Hunayn as the translator into Arabic. See Gätje (1971), 69–70.

77. Edited by Genequand (2001); see above, note 9.

78. Or to Ibrahim ibn ‘Abdallah al-Nasrani al-Katib (see Genequand 2001, 31–39), mentioned in the sources as one of the translators of the Topics.

79. The translation is extant: see Al-Ahwani (1952), Badawi (1952, 2nd ed. 1980), 1021–68 (edition 1952), 1055–104 (edition 1980). It has been made out of the Syriac version of Athanasius of Balad (d. 687): see Gyekye (1979), 16. On the Syriac versions of the Isagoge, as well as on its circulation in Kindi's times, see above, note 15; for a survey on the Arabic Porphyry, one may see D'Ancona (2011c); much more detailed is the all-embracing entry by Hugonnard-Roche (2012); on the Isagoge, both Syriac and Arabic, 1450–60.

80. K. al-Fihrist, 252.15 Flügel = 313.23 Tajaddud. This work is lost in Greek, but was known to Boethius.

81. K. al-Fihrist, 248.20 Flügel = 309.4 Tajaddud.

82. On this scholar (a pupil of Yahya ibn ‘Adi: see below, notes 109, 110) as well as on his “edition”, see Hugonnard-Roche (1993) and Martini Bonadeo (2011c).

83. K. al-Fihrist, 250.21–22 Flügel = 311.6–7 Tajaddud. This translation has not come down to us, but Porphyry's commentary was known to some extent (and in all likelihood indirectly) to the Arab readers: an opinion held by Porphyry "in the second treatise of the Physics" is recorded by Abu Bakr al-Razi (the Rhazes of the Latin Middle Ages): see Brown (1972), Genequand (1984), Adamson (2007).

84. K. al-Fihrist, 252.2 Flügel = 312.18 Tajaddud; see Zonta (2003), 192–94. This commentary was known to some extent: al-Farabi and al-‘Amiri refer to it (see Martini Bonadeo 2008, 56.13, 170, and Ghorab 1972)

85. Edited by Daiber (1995). On the span of time of the translation see Daiber (1995), 15.

86. K. al-Fihrist, 251.12 Flügel = 311.25 Tajaddud. Edition: Lyons (1973); see Elamrani Jamal (2003), 352–3 and Coda (2011), 1262. On the Syriac, Arabic, and Hebrew versions of Themistius' works see Coda (2011), with up-to-date bibliography also on the works lost in Greek, like the Treatise in Response to Maxim on the reduction of the second and third figures of the syllogism to the first figure.

87. Incomplete (only nine arguments), but containing the first argument, which is lost in Greek: see Anawati (1956), Endress (1973), 15–16 and (2012), 1657–61. This translation is extant and edited: Badawi (1955), 32–42.

88. Lost in Greek, albeit doxographically preserved by Simplicius: see Wildberg (1987).

89. It seems to be unknown to al-Kindi, whereas al-Farabi (d. 950) has written a treatise against it: see Kraemer (1965); Mahdi (1967) and (1972). Up-to-date bibliography in Gannagé (2012), 537–50. Another writing by Philoponus on the createdness of the universe is extant in Arabic: see Pines (1972) and Troupeau (1984). An analysis of the intricacies of this textual tradition has been provided by Gannagé (2012), 550–2. According to the bio-bibliographical sources, Philoponus' commentaries on the Categories, De Interpretatione, An. Pr., An. Po., Topics, and Porphyry's Isagoge were translated into Arabic; since they are lost (although attested in various ways), and since there is no mention of the translators, it is not easy to determine when they became available to the Arab readership; also from this viewpoint Gannagé (2012), 511–18 is an accurate and clear source of information.

90. See Endress (1997b). On the reception of this model in al-Farabi and in Avicenna see Reisman (2005), Gutas (2005), Bertolacci (2006). It has been advanced by Gutas (1998b), 242–52, followed by Bertolacci (2006), 149–211, that al-Farabi counts as a turning point in the Arab reception of Greek metaphysics, in so far as the latter, at variance with al-Kindi, realized that metaphysics does not collapse with rational theology. For another account of the divide between al-Kindi and al-Farabi see Puig Montada (2011), pointing he too to the attitudes of these two philosophers towards Mu‘tazilite Kalam, but with a different emphasis. While Gutas and Bertolacci see the divide between al-Kindi and al-Farabi in that the latter was aware of the distinction between ontology and theology, Puig Montada highlights the difference between the two cosmological models: al-Kindi sides with creation in time, a basic issue of Mu‘tazilite Kalam, and al-Farabi decides in favor of emanationism.

91. On the cosmopolitan atmosphere of the circle animated by Yahya ibn ‘Adi and his successor Abu Sulayman al-Sijistani see Kraemer (1992), outlining as follows the membership and main features of this group: “The chief architects of this philosophic humanism in our period were the Christian philosophers Yahya b. ‘Adi and his immediate disciples. They divide into two groups. The first—Ibn ‘Adi's Christian pupils—continued the (predominantly Christian) tradition of meticulous textual editing, translating and commenting, which goes back to Hunayn b. Ishaq and his school (…). The second group of disciples were Muslim scholars (…) in the circles of Yahya b. ‘Adi and of his pupil Abu Sulayman al-Sijistani, and in the general ambiance of the time, Muslims, Christians, Jews, Sabians, and Mazdaeans communed in the study of the ancients—united by what Werner Jaeger once called ‘the ecumenical power of antiquity’.” (Kraemer [1992], 6–7). On Yahya ibn ‘Adi see below note 101.

92. The ancient sources record an argument he had in the year 938, about the possibility to translate the Greek sources into Arabic, with the grammarian Abu Sa‘id al-Sirafi: the latter was arguing against the reasonableness of such an enterprise, and did not refrain from remarking that Matta, in addition, was translating from Syriac instead of from Greek. See Endress (1986).

93. K. al-Fihrist, 246.5 Flügel = 306.20 Tajaddud. For more details see Gutas (2012), 852–3.

94. K. al-Fihrist, 249.12 Flügel = 309.23 Tajaddud; see Elamrani Jamal (1989), 522. Another Arabic version of an unknowk author lies in the background of Averroes' Middle Commentary on the An. Po., as shown by Minio Paluello (1951); Hugonnard-Roche (1999) has convincingly argued that this version is later than Abu Bishr Matta's one and counts as a reworking of it, possibly influenced by Themistius' paraphrase of the An. Po..

95. K. al-Fihrist, 250.4 Flügel = 310.16 Tajaddud. The translation is extant: Tkatsch (1928–32); see Schrier (1997) and Hugonnard-Roche (2003c), 208–10.

96. K. al-Fihrist, 249.21 Flügel = 312.9 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 527. For a survey on Aristotle's logical works and their circulation in the Arabic-speaking world see El-Rouayheb (2011).

97. K. al-Fihrist, 250.29 Flügel = 311.12 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (2003 a), 284.

98. K. al-Fihrist, 251.4 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud; see Rashed (2003), 305.

99. K. al-Fihrist, 251.20 Flügel = 312.2 Tajaddud; see Hasnaoui (1996) and Di Martino (2003), 375–78.

100. K. al-Fihrist, 251.28 Flügel = 312.14–15 Tajaddud: see above, note 75, for the (lost) translation into Syriac attributed to Hunayn ibn Ishaq; the Arabic translation is lost too, but some quotations appear in Averroes' Great Commentary, as mentioned in the main text by note 75; for further details see Martin (1989), 532 and Martini Bonadeo (2003), 263.

101. On Yahya ibn ‘Adi's biography and work see Endress (1977), Platti (1983), and Martini Bonadeo (2011e); for an overview of his translations, see also Kraemer (1992), 108–10.

102. K. al-Fihrist, 251.15–16 Flügel = 309.27 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 524 and Elamrani Jamal (1989), 225.

103. K. al-Fihrist, 249.27 Flügel = 310.9 Tajaddud); see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 527.

104. K. al-Fihrist, 250.4–5 Flügel = 310.16 Tajaddud; see Hugonnard-Roche (2003c), 211.

105. Lyons (1982), xxiii-xxiv; see Stern (1956), Aouad (1989c), 457, and Martini Bonadeo (2011b). On the influence of the Rhetoric on Arabic philosophical thought see Black (1990).

106. On this physician, theologian and commentator of Aristotle's corpus see Ferrari (2006).

107. K. al-Fihrist, 252.11 Flügel = 312.26 Tajaddud; see Gutas (2010), 84–5.

108. See above, note 73.

109. K. al-Fihrist, 264.26 Flügel = 323.7–8 Tajaddud: see Drossaart Lulofs (1965), 10 and 39. The Arabic translation survives only in the fragments quoted by Averroes' in his Great Commentary on the Metaphysics: see Freudenthal (1885), 126–27. On Ibn Zur‘a see Martini Bonadeo (2011d).

110. K. al-Fihrist, 254.1–4 Flügel = 314.9–12 Tajaddud: see Drossaart Lulofs (1965), 13 and 39.

111. K. al-Fihrist, 251.4 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud. See the English translation of the remnants of the Arabic version by Gannagé (2005); cf. also Fazzo (2003), 63 and Rashed (2003), 312–14.

112. Mentioned in the K. al-Fihrist, 251.9 Flügel = 311.22 Tajaddud; see Endress (1977), 25–26.

113. The translation by Abu Bishr Matta was corrected by Yahya ibn ‘Adi: see Goulet-Aouad (1989), 130 and Hugonnard-Roche (2003), 287.

114. Translated into French by Thillet (2003).

115. K. al-Fihrist, 250.22–23 Flügel = 311.7 Tajaddud; see Coda (2011), 1262.

116. Lettinck (1994), 4: “The Leiden MS which contains Ishaq's translation is the outcome of the study of the Physics in the Baghdad school of Yahya ibn ‘Adi (d. 973) and his pupil Abu ‘Ali ibn as-Samh (d. 1027). Besides the Arabic text of the Physics it contains commentaries by Ibn as-Samh, Yahya ibn ‘Adi, Yahya's teacher Abu Bishr Matta ibn Yunus (d. 940), and Abu l-Faraj ibn at-Tayyib (d. 1044). In addition a few comments of Alexander and Themistius are quoted, as well as some phrases from the translations of Qusta and ad-Dimashqi. Many comments in Books III–VII are preceded by the name ‘Yahya’; they appear to be a summary or paraphrase of Philoponus' commentary. (…) The editor of the text in the Leiden MS was Abu l-Husayn al-Basri (d. 1044), a pupil of Ibn as-Samh”. See also Giannakis (1993) and (1995–96); up-to-date survey by Gannagé (2012), 518–21.

117. This paraphrasis is mentioned in the K. al-Fihrist, 250.30 Flügel = 311.13 Tajaddud: it has been translated by Abu Bishr Matta and corrected by Yahya ibn ‘Adi. The Arabic version is lost; its Hebrew translation is extant and has been edited, together with the Latin version: Landauer (1902); see Hugonnard-Roche (2003a), 287; Coda (2011), 1263, and Coda (2012). An Arabic version was made also of Themistius' paraphrasis of the An. Post.: it is lost, but the Latin translation made from Arabic is extant: see Hugonnard-Roche (1989), 52, Coda (2011), 1261–2.

118. Paraphrasis of the An. Po.: K. al-Fihrist, 249.13 Flügel = 309.24 Tajaddud: this text is lost, but was known to Averroes: see Hugonnard-Roche (1999). Paraphrasis of Metaphysics Lambda: K. al-Fihrist, 251.29–30 Flügel = 312.15–16 Tajaddud. The text is extant and translated into French: see Brague (1999). On its importance in shaping the subsequent interpretations of Aristotle's philosophical theology see Pines (1987).A more complicated issue is that of Themistius' work on the Topics, whose Arabic translation is lost, but has been widely quoted (chiefly by Averroes). It is mentioned in the K. al-Fihrist twice, namely in the entry on Aristotle apropos the Topics (24923 Flügel = 310.6 Tajaddud) and in thet on Abu Bishr Matta (246.1 Flügel = 322.15 Tajaddud). It has been advanced by Hasnawi (2007) that the two passages may point to different works; on Averroes' quotations, see Gutas (1999); for an overview with up-to-date bibliography, see Coda (2011), 1261–3.

119. K. al-Fihrist, 248.21 Flügel = 309.5 Tajaddud; see Zimmermann (1981), cii n. 1.

120. K. al-Fihrist, 251.8 Flügel = 311.22 Tajaddud. The commentary was translated by Abu Bishr Matta and annotated by Abu ‘Amr al-Tabari: see Hasnaoui (1996), 41–2. It is lost to us; for an epitome of the Meteorologica attributed to Olympiodorus see above, note 90 and Badawi (1971), 95–190.

121. K. al-Fihrist, 251.5 Flügel = 311.18 Tajaddud: see Rashed (2003), 312.

122. K. al-Fihrist, 251.13–14 Flügel = 311.26 Tajaddud: see Elamrani Jamal (2003), 354.

123. K. al-Fihrist, 248.21 Flügel = 309.4 Tajaddud.

124. See above, note 49.