Notes to Jean Bodin
1. Here, and in all subsequent occurrences, “[trans. by the author]” serves to indicate that the relevant passage was originally translated from Latin into French by Mario Turchetti and was subsequently translated from French into English by the translator of this entry, James Blakeley.
2. An allusion to the anonymous work, Du droit des Magistrats sur leurs sujets. Traité très nécessaire en ce temps pour advertir de leur devoir tant les magistrats que tous les sujets [Genève], 1574. The work was attributed to Théodore de Bèze three centuries later.
3. François Hotman, Francogallia, Genevae, J. Stoer, 1573 (Latin text by Ralph E. Gisey, English trans. by J.H.M. Salmon, Cambridge University Press, 1972); Innocent Gentillet, Discours sur les moyens de bien gouverner et maintenir en bonne paix un royaume […] Contre Nicolas Machiavel [Genève], 1576. The most important text, Vindiciae contra tyrannos, was published in 1579 under the pseudonym of Stephanus Junius Brutus (ed. and trans. by George Garnett, Cambridge University Press, 1994).
4. The Act of Association passed between the Catholics and those of the so-called Reformed Religion seeking the reestablishment of the Kingdom of France against the bad and pernicious counselors of his Majesty. [Traicté d'Association passé entre les Catholiques et ceux de la religion réformée pourchassans le restablissement du Royaume de France, contre les mauvais er pernicieux conseillers de sa Majesté], place of publication unknown.
5. Manifeste de Péronne, June 8, 1576. See Articles de la ligue et association de quelques catholiques ennemis de la paix establie en France, [place of publication unknown], 1576. At the end, there is the slogan, “One for all!”
6. De amplitudine et excellenti historiae propheticae dignitate, Vitenbergae, Gronenberg, c. 1580.
7. Discours philosophiques, en nombre dix neuf, esquels est amplement traité de l'essence de l'âme et de la vertu morale, Paris: Jean Borel, 1579. See Bodin, République, VI, 6.
8. Advertissements à M. J. Bodin sur le quatrième livre de sa République, Toulouse, Colomiès, 1580.
9. See Turchetti 1993. See also P. de Beloy, Conference des edicts de pacification des troubles esmeus au Royaume de France, pour le faict de la Religion ; et Traittez ou Reglement faicts par les Rois Charles IX, et Henri III. Et de la Declaration d'iceux, Du Roy Henri IIII. de France et de Navarre. Publiee en Parlement le 25. Fevrier 1599. Avec explication du contenu en chascun article par l'histoire Ecclesiastique et profane, droicts Civil et Canonique, Ordonnances et Coustumes de ce Royaume. Par Mre Pierre de Beloy, Conseiller du Roy, et son Advocat general au Parlement de Tholose, Paris: P. L'Huilleir et I. Mettayer, 1600.
10. For “division,” see Matthias Flacius Illyricus, Centuriae Magdeburgenses, vol. I, 1556, in which a table of contents is entitled “Methodus”. For “ratio” see Erasmus, Ratio seu methodus compendio perveniendi ad veram theologiam, Maguntiae, 1519.
11. See for example: Giovanni Pontano, Actius, 1499; Speron Speroni, Dell'Historia, in Dialoghi del Sig. S. Speroni, 1542; Francesco Robortello, De facultate historica disputatio, 1548; Sebastiano Fox Morcillo, De historiae institutione liber, 1557; Christoforo Mileo, De scribenda universitatis rerum historia; Dionigi Atanagi, Ragionamento della eccellentia et perfettione della historia, 1559. Most of those works were published in Artis historicae penus octodecim scriptorum tam veterum quam recentiorum monumentis et inter eos Jo. praecipue Bodini libris, Methodi historiae sex instructa, Basileae, P. Pernae officina, 1579 (second edition).
12. Chapter headings from Six Books of the Commonwealth by Jean Bodin, abridged and translated by M. J. Tooley, Basil Blackwell Oxford, printed in Great Britain in the City of Oxford at the Alden Press Bound by the Kemp Hall Bindery, 1955, Oxford.
13. In [Lettre Bautru, we find ([Ro], 79):
Veram religionem aliud nihil esse quam purgatae mentis in Deum conversionem
The same expression appears in [Methodus] ([Me] 121):
… religio vero ipsa, id est purgatae mentis in Deum recta conversio
The theme here is of a “proper turning to God with a purified spirit.”
14. See the frequently cited passages of [République], IV, 7 ([Mc] 537–539), about the idea of “Religion not to be enforced.” They are very important for Bodin's opinion about liberty of conscience, but they are not directly connected with his political theory of religious tolerance: the first notion depends on the conscience, the heart of hearts, i.e. the private life; the second one is a matter for the public law.
15. See Collinet 1908, pp. 752ff. and Collinet 1910, p. 128–129. See also Chauviré 1914, p. 35, n. 3.
