Notes to Saint Bonaventure

1. Two dates of Bonaventure are recorded in medieval sources—his death (15 July 1274) and the year he was licensed by John of Parma (1248); all other dates are determined by inference. Our chronology follows Bougerol 1988, Quinn 1972, Quinn 1982, and Monti 1994.

2. Legenda maior, prol. 3, in Francis of Assisi: Early Documents, ed. R. J. Armstrong, J. Hellman, W. Short (New York: New City Press, 2000) 528. Cf. Legenda minor, lec. 8. Texts of Bonaventure will be quoted in the Quaracchi edition, 1882-1902.

3. Prohibition of 1210: Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I: 70, trans. L. Thorndyke, University Records and Life in the Middle Ages 26-7. Rules for determining in Arts, 1252: Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I: 227-30, trans. Thorndyke 52-6. Courses in Arts, 1255: Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I: 277-9, trans. Thorndyke 64-5. Cf. F. van Steenberghen, Aristotle in the West (Louvain: 1970). For student guides for examinations dating to the period 1230-1250, see Claude Lafleur, Quatre introductions à la philosophie au XIIIe siècle: textes critique et étude historique (Montréal/Paris: Institut d'études médiévales/Libraire Philosophique, J. Vrin, 1988) with a helpful overview of student life in the Arts faculty to be found on 141-54.

4. Salimbene, Chronica, ed. Holder-Egger, 209, quoted in Bougerol, Introduction 178. T. Crowley, “St. Bonaventure's Chronology Revisited” Franziskanische Studien 46 (1974): 310-22, erroneously thought Salimbene meant Bonaventure incepted as Master of Theology in 1248.

5. Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 230: 252-8, trans. Thorndyke 56-64. Cf. Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 219: 242, April 1253, expelling the friars from the University. On this conflict see M.-M. Dufeil, Guillaume de Saint-Amour et la polemique universitaire parisienne: 1250-1259 (Paris: 1972).

6. Condemnation of William of St. Amour, Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 287-88: 329-33. In Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 293: 339, referring to Odo of Douai and Christian of Beauvais, Alexander IV ordered “that the Friar Preachers and Minors present at Paris, masters and their students, and especially by name, Friars Thomas of Aquino of the Order of Preachers and Bonaventure of the Order of Minors, doctors of theology, with maximum effort they shall receive them into the academic community and to the University of Paris, and expressly they shall receive these doctors as Masters; and that, while they are in Paris, they shall publicly make this same promise, and, in accordance with the aforesaid ordinance they shall attempt to have those doctors received by the University, both masters and students, with good faith; and they shall not plan or agree to anything contrary to the foregoing.” Christian of Beauvais did so, Chartularium Universitatis Parisiensis I, no. 317: 366.

7. Bonaventure, Legenda maior 13.3, in Francis of Assisi: Early Documents, Volume 3, 632-33.

8. A. Franchi, “Analisi storiografica del ruolo di Bonaventura al Conclave di Viterbo (1268-1271),” Doctor seraphicus 28 (1981): 65-77. Cf. Q 10: 61. Bartholomew of Pisa, the earliest source for Bonaventure suggesting Teobaldo's name, wrote ca. 1385.

9. A. Franchi, Il Concilio II di Lione (1274) secondo la Ordinatio Concilii Generalis Lugdunensis (Rome: 1965) 95, in J. Bougerol, Introduction à S. Bonaventure (Paris: Vrin, 1988) 11.

10. F. van Steenberghen, Aristotle in the West, 162: “In short, St. Bonaventure's philosophy is an eclectic Aristotelianism with neo-Platonic tendencies, put at the service of an Augustinian theology.” 159: “The difference between the two lies in this: St. Thomas had meditated deeply on philosophical problems and had carved out a solid system of philosophy before using it in theology; while St. Bonaventure did not do this to the same extent.” The existence of God Bonaventure “treated in summary fashion.” Cf. La philosophie au xiiie siecle (Louvain: 1966): 268-271. E. Gilson, The Philosophy of St. Bonaventure, tr. Trethowan, Sheed (Paterson, NJ: 1965): 445.

11.Bonaventure, In I Sent. prol. 9.1 ad 5m; 2c (ed. Quaracchi I 8b).

12.Bonaventure, In I Sent. prol., q. 1 conclusio (ed. Quaracchi I 7b): “prout tamen credibile transit in rationem intelligibilis, et hoc per additionem rationis.”

13. “Rarely if ever has the relation between the philosophical doctrine of being and the trinitarian dogma of faith been worked out with such elaborate care” (Z. Hayes, “Introduction,” Disputed Questions on the Mystery of the Trinity: 27).

14. Bonaventure, In I Sent. d. 3, pars 1, q. 2, ad 4 (ed. Quaracchi I 73b)

15. Phillipi Cancellarii, Summa de bono, ed. Nicolai Wicki, ‘De bono naturae’, q. 3 (49: 48-54): “Haec enim est intentio secundum proprietatem illius philosophiae ut ostendatur mobile et motum et tempus esse coaequeva, neque in amplius possunt rationes quae ibi sumuntur ex principiis illius philosophiae. Quod si ipsum mobile esset aeternum, motus esset aeternus et tempus. Non fuit autem de proprietate illius philosophiae investigare exitum primi mobilis in esse et sic separare mobile ab immobili, ut in planetis, sed quod motus sit ab immobili. Nec determinat quod ille motor sit prima causa.” Albertus Magnus, In II Sent., d. 1, B, art. 11 (ed. Borgnet, 30b): “… Aristoteles in veritate non dicit hoc, quod tria vel duo sint principia mundi. Sed ipse probat duo non incepisse per motum, scilicet materiam et motorem primum: et ideo imponitur ei quod duo dixerit esse ab aeterno.”; ______, In II Sent., d. 1, B, art. 10 (ed. Borgnet, 27a): “…ergo etiamsi concedunt philosophi quod Deus est principium totius mundi, sicut omnes philosophi concedunt, non est necesse ponere propter hoc mundum incepisse."

16. Robert Grosseteste, Hexaemeron, ed. Richard C. Dales and Servus Gieben (London: Oxford University Press for the British Academy, 1982), I.viii.4 (60- 61): “Ex his itaque et multis aliis quae afferri possent nisi prohiberet prolixitas, evidenter patet quod plurimi philosophorum simul cum Aristotele asseruerunt mundum carere temporis principio; quos unius verbi ictu percutit et elidit Moyses dicens: In principio. Haec adduximus contra quosdam modernos, qui nituntur contra ipsum Aristotelem et suos expositores et sacros simul expositores de Aristotele haeretico facere catholicum, mira caecitate et praesumptione putantes se limpidius intelligere et verius interpretari Aristotelem ex littera latina corrupta quam philosophos, tam gentiles quam catholicos, qui eius litteram incorruptam originalem graecam plenissime noverunt. Non igitur se decipiant et frustra desudent ut Aristotelem faciant catholicum, ne inutiliter tempus suum et vires ingenii consument, et Aristotelem catholicum constituendo, se ipsos haereticos faciant.” Guillelmi Alverni episcopi Parisiensis, De universo tom. 1 in Opera omnia (Amiens: Hotot, 1674), Secunda pars primae partis principalis, cap. 8 (690, col. 2, H): "Quidquid igitur dicatur, et quicumque conentur excusare Aristotelem, haec indubitanter fuit eius sententia, quod mundus est aeternus et quod non coepit esse; et de motu similiter sensit, et Avicenna post eum. Et adduxerunt rationes et probationes ad hoc. Similiter et alii expositores eiusdem Aristotelis id ipsum senserunt atque fecerunt.”

17. Bonaventure, In II Sent., lib. II, d. 1, pars 1, art. 1, qu. 2, resp. (ed. Quaracchi, II, 22b): “Et magis rationabile est quam suum oppositum, scilicet quod materia fuerit aeternaliter imperfecta, sine forma et divina influentia, sicut posuerunt quidam philosophorum; et adeo rationabilius, ut etiam ille excellentior inter philosophos, Aristoteles, secundum quod Sancti imponunt, et commentatores exponunt, et verba eius praetendunt, in hunc errorem dilapsus fuerit.”

18. Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 1, pars 1, art. 1, qu. 2 (ed. Quaracchi, II: 22a-b): “Respondeo: Dicendum quod ponere mundum aeternum esse sive aeternaliter productum, ponendo res omnes ex nihilo productas, omnino est contra veritatem et rationem, sicut ultima ratio probat; et adeo contra rationem, ut nullum philosophorum quantumcumque parvi intellectus crediderim hoc posuisse. Hoc enim implicat in se manifestam contradictionem.—Ponere autem mundum aeternum, praesupposita aeternitate materiae, rationabile videtur et intelligible…” For the differing interpretations of Bonaventure's position on creation and the eternity of the world, see Stephen Baldner, “St. Bonaventure on the Temporal Beginning of the World,” The New Scholasticism, 63, no. 2 (Spring, 1989), 206-228; Matthew D. Walz, “Theological and Philosophical Dependencies in St. Bonaventure's Argument Against an Eternal World and a Brief Thomistic Reply,” American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly 72.1 (Winter, 1998), 75-82.

19. Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 1, pars 1, art. 1, qu. 2 (ed. Quaracchi, II, 22a): “…impossibile est, quod habet esse post non-esse habere esse aeternum, quoniam hic est implicatio contradictionis; sed mundus habet esse post non-esse; ergo impossibile est esse aeternum. Quod autem habeat esse post non-esse, probatur sic: omne illud quod totaliter habet esse ab aliquo, producitur ab illo ex nihilo; sed mundus totaliter habet esse a Deo; ergo mundus ex nihilo; sed non ex nihilo materialiter; ergo originaliter. Quod autem omne quod totaliter producitur ab aliquo differente per essentiam, habeat esse ex nihilo, patens est. Nam quod totaliter producitur, producitur secundum materiam et formam; sed materia non habet ex quo producatur, quia non ex Deo; manifestum est igitur quod ex nihilo.” The term ‘after’ needs to be carefully understood here; ‘after’ does not function as a temporal designator since we are explaining, in part, the very origin of time itself. Bonaventure himself prefers the locution that things are created with time (see Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 2, p. 1, dub. 2 [ed. Quaracchi, II, 69b-70b])

20. Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 12, art. 1, q. 1 (ed. Quaracchi, II, 294a).

21. Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 12, art. 1, q.2 (ed. Quaracchi, II, 296b).

22. Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 12, art. 1, q.3 (ed. Quaracchi, II, 299b-300a).

23. Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 12, art. 2, q.1 (ed. Quaracchi, II, 303a-b). The term ‘physical matter’ is being employed instead of simply ‘matter’ because matter in its essence is actually broader than physical matter. Insofar as matter denotes a principle of potentiality, matter is found even in non-physical entities such as angels and human souls. See section IV, rational creatures.

24. Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 3, p. 1 art. 1, q.2 (ed. Quaracchi, II, 97a).

25. Bonaventure, In II Sent. d. 13, art. 1, q. 1 (ed. Quaracchi, II, 312b-313a).

26. Bonaventure, In II Sent. d. 13, art. 2, q. 2 (ed. Quaracchi, II, 320b-321b).

27. Bonaventure, Itinerarium cap. I, n. 11 (ed. Quaracchi V 298b).

28. Bonaventure, Itinerarium cap. I, n. 14 (ed. Quaracchi V 299a-b)

29. Bonaventure, Itinerarium cap. II, n. 6 (ed. Quaracchi V 301a)

30. Bonaventure, Itinerarium cap. III, n. 3 (ed. Quaracchi V 394a): “…cum privationes et defectus nullatenus possint cognosci nisi per positiones, non venit intellectus noster ut plene resolvens intellectum alicuius entium creatorum nisi iuvetur ab intellectu entis purissimi, actualissimi, completissimi, et absoluti, quod est ens simpliciter et aeternum, in quo sunt rationes omnium in sua puritate. Quomodo autem sciret intellectus hoc esse ens defectivum et incompletum, si nullam haberet cognitionem entis absque omni defectu? Et sic de aliis conditionibus praelibatis.”

31. Bonaventure, Itinerarium cap. V, n. 3 (ed. Quaracchi V 308b-309a): “Cum autem non-esse privatio sit essendi, non cadit in intellectum nisi per esse; esse autem non cadit per aliud, quia omne quod intelligitur, aut intelligitur ut non ens, aut ut ens in potentia, aut ut ens in actu. Si igitur non ens non potest intelligi nisi per ens, et ens in potentia per ens in actu, et esse nominat ipsum purum actum entis: esse igitur est quod primo cadit in intellectu, et illud esse est quod est actus purus. Sed hoc non est esse particulare, quod est esse arctatum, quia permixtum est cum potentia; nec esse analogum, quia minime habet de actu, eo quod minime est. Restat igitur, quod illud esse est esse divinum”

32. Bonaventure, Itinerarium cap. III, n. 3 (ed. Quaracchi V 304a-b): “Intellectum autem propositionum tunc intellectus dicitur veraciter comprehendere, cum certitudinaliter scit, illas veras esse; et hoc scire est scire, quoniam non potest falli in illa comprehensione. Scit enim, quod veritas illa non potest aliter se habere; scit, igitur, illam veritatem esse incommutabilem. Sed cum ipsa mens nostra sit commutabilis, illam sic incommutabiliter relucentem non potest videre nisi per aliquam lucem omnino incommutabiliter radiantem, quam impossibile est esse creaturam mutabilem. Scit igitur in illa luce, quae illuminat omnem hominem venientem in hunc mundum, quae est lux vera et Verbum in principio apud Deum.”

33. Bonaventure, In II Sent. d. 24, pars 1, art 2, q. 4 (ed. Quaracchi II, 568b): “Sic credendum indubitanter, quod animae humanae non tantummodo dederit [sc. Deus] intellectum possibilem, sed etiam agentem, ita quod uterque est aliquid ipsius animae.”

34. Bonaventure, In II Sent. d. 24, pars 1 art. 2, q. 4 (ed. Quaracchi II, 569b-570a).

35. Bonaventure, Quaestiones disp. de scientia Christi, q. 4 (ed. Quaracchi V 23b)

36. Bonaventure, Itenerarium cap. III, n. 5-6 (ed. Quaracchi V 305a-b).

37. Bonaventure, In II Sent. d. 3 pars 1, art. 1, q. 2 resp. (ed. Quaracchi II 97b).

38. Bonaventure, In II Sent., d. 3, pars 1, art. 1, q. 1 resp. (ed. Quaracchi II 91a); In II Sent. d. 17, art. 1, q. 2, resp. (ed. Quaracchi II 414b-415a).

39. Bonaventure, In II Sent. d. 3, pars 1, art. 2, q. 3 resp. (ed. Quaracchi II 109b-110a) On the principle of individuation in Bonaventure, see Peter O. King, “Bonaventure (b. ca. 1216, d. 1274),” in Individuation in Scholasticism: The Later Middle Ages and the Counter-Reformation, 1150-1650.

40. Bonaventure, Collationes in Hexaemeron 6.1 (ed. Quaracchi V 360).

41. Bonaventure, Collationes in Hexaemeron 1.13 (ed. Quaracchi V: 331). Cf. Andreas Speer, “Bonaventure and the Question of a Medieval Philosophy,” Medieval Philosophy and Theology 6 (1997): 30-1.

42. Bonaventure, In I Sent. d. 3, pars 1, art. 1, q. 2 concl. (ed. Quaracchi I 72a-b).

43. Bonaventure, De mysterio trinitatis 1.1 concl. (ed. Quaracchi V 49); tr. Hayes 116.

44. Bonaventure, In I Sent. d. 8, pars 1, art. 2 (ed. Quaracchi I 155).

45. Bonaventure, De scientia Christi q. 4 concl. (ed. Quaracchi V 23).

46. Bonaventure, De scientia Christi q. 4 concl. (ed. Quaracchi V 23).

47. Bonaventure, In II Sent. d. 24, pars 1, art. 2, q. 4 (ed. Quaracchi II 567-571). Cf. J. Quinn, The Historical Constitution of St. Bonaventure's Philosophy (Toronto: PIMS, 1973) 345-352.

48. Bonaventure, De scientia Christi q. 4 (ed. Quaracchi V 23).

49. Bonaventure, In I Sent. d. 8, art. 1, qu. 2 (ed. Quaracchi I 155).

50. Bonaventure, In II Sent. d. 3, pars 1, art. 2, q. 3 concl. (ed. Quaracchi II 110): “Existere dat materia formae, sed essendi actum dat forma materiae.”

51. Bonaventure, De mysterio trinitatis 1.1 arg. 11-20 (ed. Quaracchi V 46b-47b). The disjunctive transcendentals are: posterior and prior; from another and not from another; possible and necessary; relative and absolute; qualified and absolute; from another and from itself; by participation and essentially; potential and actual; composite and simple; and changeable and unchangeable.

52. Bonaventure, In I Sent. d. 8, a. 1, q. 2 concl. (ed. Quaracchi I 154b).

53. Bonaventure, De mysterio trinitatis. 1.1 (ed. Quaracchi V 49).

54. Bonaventure, Itinerarium 3.3 (ed. Quaracchi V 304a); cf. Avicenna, Metaphysics 1.5.

55. Bonaventure, In I Sent. d. 8, art. 1, q. 1 concl. (ed. Quaracchi. I 151b).

56. Bonaventure, In I Sent. d. 8, art. 1, q. 1 concl. (ed. Quaracchi. I 151b).

57. Bonaventure, De mysterio trinitatis 1.1 fund. 29 (ed. Quaracchi V 48).

58. Bonaventure, De mysterio trinitatis. 1.1 ad 6 (ed. Quaracchi V 50).

59. Bonaventure, Itinerarium 5.3 (ed. Quaracchi V 308): “Volens igitur contemplari Dei invisibilia quoad essentiae unitatem primo defigat aspectum in ipsum esse et videat, ipsum esse adeo in se certissimum, quod non potest cogitari non esse.”

60. Bonaventure, Itinerarium 5.3 (ed. Quaracchi V 308): “quia ipsum esse purissimum non occurrit nisi in plena fuga non-esse, sicut et nihil in plena fuga esse. Sicut igitur omnino nihil nihil habet de esse nec de eius conditionibus; sic econtra ipsum esse nihil habet de non-esse, nec actu nec potentia, nec secundum veritatem rei nec secundum aestimationem nostram.”

61. Bonaventure, Itinerarium 5.3 (ed. Quaracchi V 308): “Cum autem non-esse privatio sit essendi, non cadit in intellectum nisi per esse; esse autem non cadit per aliud, quia omne, quod intelligitur, aut intelligitur ut non ens, aut ut ens in potentia, aut ut ens in actu. Si igitur non ens non potest intelligi nisi per ens, et ens in potentia non nisi per ens in actu; et esse nominat ipsum purum actum entis: esse igitur est quod primo cadit in intellectu, et illud esse est quod est purus actus.”

62. Bonaventure, Itinerarium 5.3 (ed. Quaracchi V 308-309): “Sed hoc non est esse particulare, quod est esse arctatum, quia permixtum est cum potentia, nec esse analogum, quia minime habet de actu, eo quod minime est. Restat igitur, quod illud esse est esse divinum.”

63. Cf. J. Seifert, “Si Deus est Deus, Deus est” 218, for whom the argument takes its “starting point in the objective essence and not in a mere concept of God.”