Sentence Connectives in Formal Logic

First published Tue May 4, 2010; substantive revision Wed Sep 2, 2015

Natural language sentence-linking words (like “and”, “or”) have traditionally had aspects of their use simulated by corresponding connectives in various systems of formal logic. (In fact we use the word “connective” more generously, so that there don’t have to be two or more sentences linked, allowing us to consider the analogues of words like “not” and “necessarily” as connectives too.) Amongst the questions this enterprise has raised are the following. (1) Which such naturally occurring sentence connectives call for a treatment of this kind? (Which of them should be counted as ‘logical constants’?) (2) Do the aspects of their use which are simulated in that process exhaust what we might think of as their meanings, or is there typically some mismatch here? Of course this second question depends on the particular formal treatment given, since different logics may disagree on the formal principles accorded to their representatives—for example in the case of “if”, but according to one famous line of thought (developed by H. P. Grice) when we focus specifically on their treatment in classical propositional logic, any such apparent discrepancies can be explained away by appeal to pragmatic principles regulating ordinary cooperative conversation, and do not reflect differences of meaning (semantic differences).

Neither question (1) nor question (2) will be addressed here. Instead, this entry focusses on the properties of—and relations between—the formal representatives of these connectives. Examples of such properties include truth-functionality and a replacement property called congruentiality, and of such relations what we call the subconnective relation—relating one connective to another when (roughly speaking) does every logical principle holding for the first of a pair of connectives also holds for the second. In fact, all of these concepts are subject to a further relativity. For instance a connective is or is not congruential according to a given logic, with a similar relativity in the case of whether one connective is a subconnective of another. On the other hand, as truth-functionality is defined below, a connective is or is not truth-functional with respect to a class of truth-value assignments—and various interesting further relations give rise to a corresponding logic-relative version of this concept depending on the different ways a class of truth-value assignments is linked to a logic (which in turn depends on how we think of a logic—as an ordinary consequence relation, for example, or as a ‘multiple conclusion’ consequence relation: see further note 1 below). For some other properties, the further relativity is a bit different. For example, whether a given connective is uniquely characterized—in the sense of being governed by rules which when reduplicated to govern a new connective render compounds formed from the same component sentences using the original and the new connective completely interchangeable—is relative not just to a logic but to a particular proof system (set of rules systematizing the logic).

Section 1 introduces the idea of formal sentential languages as (absolutely free) algebras, their primitive connectives having the status of the fundamental operations of these algebras, and explains the notion of a consequence relation on such a language. At a more general level, Galois connections are also introduced, and a simple observation made concerning what we call binary relational connections, to be applied in later sections. Section 2 introduces the fundamental idea of a valuation for a language (a bivalent truth-value assignment to its formulas). Truth-functionality and a generalization thereof called pseudo-truth-functionality (of a connective with respect to a class of valuations) are explained, as well as the idea of sequents and sequent-to-sequent rules. We then move to a more general conception of sequents as originally conceived, allowing a set of formulas to play the conclusion role rather than just a single formula, as well as to the associated idea of generalized consequence relations, emphasizing Carnap's motivation for making this generalization. That motivation can be summarised with reference to one connective. We take negation as our example. Consider the consequence relation determined by the class of all valuations on which the usual negation truth-function connective is associated with the negation connective. This can be regarded as the classical logic of negation, at least if logics are identified with consequence relations. Now, there are additional valuations consistent with this consequence relation on which the negation truth-function is not associated with the negation connective. (The terminology of a valuation's being consistent with a consequence relation is adapted from Dana Scott. A precise definition appears in Section 2.) But when we consider instead generalized consequence relations, the analogous discrepancy does not arise. Section 2 includes a statement of a result of D. Gabbay which isolates precisely the truth-functions for which such discrepancies do not arise (roughly: generalizations of the conjunction truth-function and various pro jection functions), as well as of a result of W. Rautenberg showing that despite this expressive weakness in the apparatus of consequence relations, they are sufficiently discriminating—without the need to pass to generalized consequence relations—to distinguish the logical properties of any two truth-functions (of the same arity).

Section 3 picks up the theme of sequent-to-sequent rules, concentrating on semantic analysis in the style of J. W. Garson of such rules, and also on the existence and uniqueness of connectives satisfying given rules (a topic introduced by H. Hiż). These last two are seen to be connected with what we call cut-inductivity and id-inductivity of specifically sequent-calculus rules, via, in the former case, a proposal identifying the existence of a connective (with prescribed logical behaviour, given the perspective provided by a logic not explicitly providing such a connective) with conservative extension (of the given logic by rules for the new connective detailing that behaviour). This proposal was made by N. D. Belnap; some problems for conservative extension as a sufficient condition for granting the existence or intelligibility of a new connective with such-and-such logical properties are noted. Section 4 collects several cases of interest in which one might wonder about the existence of connectives with various such properties. For instance (this being Example 3 out of a total of six) one might ask if it makes sense to have a 1-ary connective with the property that two applications of this connective are equivalent to a single application of (classical) negation. Section 5 assembles notes and references.

1. Preliminaries

The connectives of the formal languages of propositional logic are typically expected to exhibit salient features of the sentence-connecting devices of natural languages, and especially such devices as are regarded as items of logical vocabulary (and, or, not, if–then,…), though it will be no part of our concern to inquire as to what their ‘logicality’ consists in. This is an issue which arises for expressions and constructions such as quantifiers, the identity predicate, and so on, and not just for sentence connectives; for this issue the entry “Logical Constants” by John MacFarlane (2015) should be consulted. The formal languages concerned may be taken to agree in constructing their formulas ultimately on the basis of the same countably infinite supply of propositional variables—or ‘sentence letters’—p1, p2,…, the first three of which we write for convenience as p, q, r. Where they differ is in respect of their stock of primitive connectives. So for example, we have the language L = (L, ∧, →, ¬, ⊥) with (set of) formulas L and connectives as indicated, of arities 2, 2, 1 and 0. (We have no qualms in the last two cases in speaking of connectives, even when there are not two or more formulas to ‘connect’. Note that 0-ary or nullary connectives are already formulas—sometimes called sentential constants—in their own right.) As the notation suggests (with boldface capitals for algebras and the corresponding italic capitals for their universes), we are thinking—in the Polish tradition—of languages as algebras, identifying the primitive connectives with the fundamental operations of such algebras, and in particular, as absolutely free algebras of their similarity types (in the present instance, ⟨2,2,1,0⟩) with the pi as free generators. This allows us to speak in the usual fashion of the main connective of a given formula, the variables occurring in and more generally the subformulas of such and such a formula, and so on, without restricting ourselves to construing the formulas as obtained specifically by concatenating various symbols.

Alongside this ‘syntactic operation’ sense of connective—explained above for the primitive connectives and extended to derived connectives presently—another use of the term is indispensable: to refer to a connective with particular logical behaviour, as when people want to compare the behaviour of intuitionistic and classical implication. In due course we will see the notion of a consequence relation as one way of specifying such behaviour. If ⊢ is such a relation there is a unique language in the above sense which is the language of ⊢ and we can think of this ‘logically loaded’ sense of connective as applying to the ordered pair ⟨#, ⊢⟩; thus in the case of intuitionistic implication this would be ⟨→, ⊢I L⟩, where ⊢I L is the consequence relation of intuitionistic logic. (In fact it would be preferable to take equivalence classes of such pairs under a relation of translational equivalence but we will make no further explicit use of these ordered pairs or any such equivalence classes, and keep this aspect of the discussion relatively informal. Instead of saying “⟨#, ⊢⟩”, we will say things like “# as it behaves according to ⊢”. It would be better still to use not consequence relations—or the later introduced generalized consequence relations—as the second coordinate of the representatives ⟨#, ⊢⟩ but instead to insert here a reference to a proof system—a set of sequent-to-sequent rules of the kind introduced below, that is—since important differences between logics fail to show up at the level which would individuate them merely as consequence relations.[1])

The ‘languages as algebras’ perspective also allows us the convenience of defining matrix evaluations (see Section 5) as just homomorphisms from the algebra of formulas to the algebra of the matrix in question, of defining derived connectives and (sentential) contexts as term functions (formerly known as polynomial functions) and algebraic functions (now commonly called polynomial functions) respectively, and so on. This treatment would need some emendation were the discussion to embrace infinitary connectives, branching connectives, and various other exotic devices, but there will be enough to consider without touching on these.

For example, there is the issue raised by the use of the notation above for the operations of L. Such a choice suggests that ∧, →, ¬ will represent conjunction, implication (or the conditional) and negation—that is, be intended to capture some aspect of the behaviour of and, if–then, and not, respectively—and that ⊥ will be some kind of falsity constant. (Similarly, while we are fixing notation, if we had written “∨”, “↔”, or “⊤”, we would be arousing expectations of disjunction, equivalence—or biconditionality—and a truth constant, respectively.) We can think of this as a matter of the inference patterns to be sanctioned by some proof system offered for L, or as a matter of how the formulas of this language are to be interpreted by assigning suitable semantic values to them (truth-values being the simplest candidates here). We refer to the former as a proof-theoretic or syntactical characterization of the logic and the latter as a semantical characterization. The terminology is somewhat unfortunate in that a perfectly respectable view in the philosophy of logic (going back at least to Gentzen) has it that the meanings of items of logical vocabulary, such as the connectives of current concern, for a particular reasoner, are given by a specification of the set of primitive rules, or a favoured subset thereof, governing those items in a proof system representing that reasoner's (perhaps idealized) inferential practices.[2] We take up some of those issues later, beginning with a reprise of the semantical side of the story at the start of the following section.

We need first some general preliminaries, and forgetting the intended application(s) for a moment, let us define, given sets S and T, a pair of functions (f, g) to be a Galois connection between S and T when  f: ℘(S) → ℘(T) and g: ℘(T)→ ℘(S), and for all S0, S1 ⊆ S, T0, T1 ⊆ T, we have S0 ⊆ g(f(S0)), T0 ⊆ f(g(T0)), S0 ⊆ S1 ⇒ f(S1) ⊆ f(S0), and T0 ⊆ T1 ⇒ g(T1) ⊆ g(T0). It is well known that the composition of g with f (respectively, f with g) in such a case is a closure operation on S (respectively, on T) in the sense of being a function (we do the S case) C: ℘(S) → ℘(S) satisfying, for all subsets S0, S1, of S:

S0 ⊆ C(S0)     C(S0) ⊆ C(S0 ∪ S1)     C(C(S0)) ⊆ C(S0).

Further, where R ⊆ S × T, the triple ⟨R, S, T⟩, which we may call a binary relational connection (between S and T), induces a Galois connection (fR,gR) between S and T when we put, for all S0 ⊆ S, T0⊆ T:

 fR(S0) = {t ∈ T : for all s ∈ S0 R(s, t)}
gR(T0) = {s ∈ S : for all t ∈ T0 R(s, t)}.

(“S” and “T” here are mnemonic for “Source” and “Target” respectively; note that we do not require S ∩ T = ∅, or even that S ≠ T.) Suppose we consider, not the sentential languages of our opening paragraph but rather first-order languages, and take S as the set of closed formulas of such a language and T as the set of models (interpretations, structures,…) for that language, then with R as the relation holding between a closed formula φ and a structure M when M ⊨ φ, fR(S0) and gR(T0) are usually denoted by Mod(S0) and Th(T0). (The labels are intended to suggest “class of all models of” and “theory of”, respectively.) In this case the derived closure operations Th ○ Mod (mapping S0 to Th(Mod(S0))) and Mod ○ Th (understood analogously) on S and T respectively deliver the set of first-order consequences of S0 and the set of all models verifying all the sentences verified by every M ∈ T0. When there is only one such M in the latter case, what is delivered is the class of structures elementarily equivalent to M. (Here we are thinking of classical first-order model theory.)

Returning to the former case: as this use of the term ‘consequences’ reminds us, a closure operation on the set of formulas of some language is conventionally called a consequence operation, and perhaps to use the notation Cn(⋅) rather than simply C(⋅), though it is often more convenient to talk in terms of the corresponding consequence relation, holding between a set of formulas Γ and an individual formula φ—notated in some such way as “Γ ⊩ φ”, “Γ ⊢ φ”, etc.—when φ ∈ Cn(Γ); when the relation has been defined semantically it is not uncommon to press “⊨” into service in this role. (This will occur once or twice below.) Certain shortcuts are usually taken with this notation, so that one writes, for example “Γ, Δ, φ, ψ ⊢ χ” and “⊢ φ” to mean “Γ ∪ Δ ∪ {φ,ψ} ⊢ χ” and “∅ ⊢ φ”, respectively. (For the moment, capital Greek letters range over sets of formulas.) The conditions given earlier for C's being a closure operation can be recast as conditions definitive of a consequence relation, conditions we do not give explicitly here. A consequence relation ⊢ on some language is finitary if whenever Γ ⊢ φ then we have Γ0 ⊢ φ for some finite Γ0 ⊆ Γ; to be substitution-invariant whenever Γ ⊢ φ then s(Γ) ⊢ s(φ) where s is any substitution, i.e., any endomorphism of the algebra of formulas (and s(Γ) is {s(ψ) | ψ ∈ Γ}); and, finally, to be congruential when φ ⊣⊢ ψ implies χ(φ) ⊣⊢ χ(ψ), in which the notation is to be understood as follows. “φ ⊣⊢ ψ” abbreviates “φ ⊢ ψ and ψ⊢ φ” (and if we are decorating the turnstile “⊢” with superscripts or subscripts, these are written only on the ⊢ and not also on the ⊣ part of the composite notation); χ is some formula constructed from propositional variables including at least one, pk, say—to indicate which we may sometimes write χ = χ(pk)—and χ(φ), for a formula φ, is the result of substituting φ for all occurrences of pk in χ. (So χ(φ) is s(χ) for the unique substitution s for which s(pi) = pi for i ≠ k and s(pk) = φ.) The χ(⋅) notation amounts to thinking of χ as a (sentential) context, and putting φ into this context amounts to producing the formula χ(φ); more generally, we can think of an n-ary context as a formula containing n distinguished propositional variables pk1,…, pkn, say—and perhaps additional variables too.[3] If there are no additional variables, then the formula χ(pk1,…, pkn) can be thought of as a derived or composite connective of the language under consideration. Returning to the 1-ary case, when φ ⊣⊢ ψ we describe φ and ψ as equivalent according to ⊢, and, following Smiley (1962), when for all χ(⋅), the formulas χ(φ) and χ(ψ) are equivalent according to ⊢, we describe φ and ψ as synonymous (according to ⊢). Thus a congruential consequence relation is one for which any equivalent formulas are synonymous.

The characterization of the (classical first-order) consequence relation given above was semantic, in that we described it in terms of the consequence operation Th ○ Mod which invokes the structures for the language and what is true in them. A proof system for first-order logic provides a direct syntactic account of when φ is a consequence of Γ, in terms of derivability using rules (and perhaps axioms) sensitive only to the form of the formulas involved. We could discuss the properties of sentence connectives in terms of such quantified languages (in which open as well as closed sentences can be their arguments) but to avoid extraneous complications prefer the setting of the propositional languages with which we began. And, as in the discussion to this point, we will generally just say “connective”, rather than “sentence connective”.

Any binary relational connection ⟨R, S, T⟩, as above, will be said to have conjunctive combinations on the left (right) if for any s0, s1 ∈ S there exists s2 ∈ S such that for all t ∈ T, R(s2, t) just in case R(s0, t) and R(s1, t) (respectively, for any t0, t1 ∈ T there exists t2 ∈ T such that for all s ∈ S, R(s, t2) just in case R(s, t0) and R(s, t1)); we call s2 (respectively, t2) a conjunctive combination of s0 and s1 (t0 and t1) in this case. Replacing the two “and”s after the words “just in case” by “or” gives the notion of disjunctive combinations on the left and right of ⟨R, S, T⟩. Both notions admit of an obvious generalization to the case in which {s0, s1} is replaced by an arbitrary subset S0 of S, and similarly on the T side. We write ∏L S0 and ∑L S0 for conjunctive and disjunctive combinations, respectively, in this case, and similarly on the right (with an “R” subscript), when we know either that such a combination is unique or that, while not unique, what is being said would be correct however a representative combination were chosen. The subscript is omitted when no confusion is likely. If, as above S0 = {s0, s1}, instead of writing ∏S0 (respectively, ∑S0), we write s0 ⋅ s1 (respectively, s0 + s1), and similarly on the right. To illustrate these concepts, consider the connection ⟨R, S, T⟩ with S some non-empty set, T its power set, and R the relation of membership (∈). There are conjunctive combinations and disjunctive combinations on the right, being intersections and unions respectively, but there are in general neither conjunctive nor disjunctive combinations on the left. Taking the former case, a conjunctive combination of s0 and s1, where these are distinct elements of S, would be an element of S belonging to precisely those subsets of S to which each of s0, s1, belongs—which is impossible since the unit set of this element—as with any unit set—contains only one element, and so not both of s0, s1. By analogy with the above definitions of conjunctive and disjunctive combinations we can also consider the existence of negative objects on the left and right of a relational connection, and note that again the set-theoretic example just given presents is with negative objects on the right (for S0 ⊆ S, the corresponding negative object is S ∖ S0), but not on the left (“no negative individuals”, as philosophers might put it, and the point would stand if we switched to the case in which T comprised properties—rather than sets—of individuals, reconstruing R accordingly). This absence of combinations simultaneously on the left and right of a relational connection is typical of non-degenerate cases, in that one can easily verify that if a relational connection has conjunctive combinations on the left and disjunctive combinations on the right, or vice versa, then it satisfies the following (rather strong) crossover condition:

for all s0, s1 ∈ S, all t0, t1 ∈ T, if R(s0, t0) and R(s1, t1), then either R(s0, t1) or R(s1, t0).

(To see this, assume the antecedent and consider the relation R as it relates s0 + s1 and t0 ⋅ t1—or, for the “vice versa”, s0 ⋅ s1 and t0 + t1.)

2. Sequents and Valuations

Let us return to the propositional languages with which we began. A valuation for such an L is a function from L to the two-element set {T, F} (of truth-values). As in the case of first-order languages touched on above, we put the set of formulas L in the source position (i.e. on the left) of our relational connections ⟨L, V, R⟩, with the set V of all valuations for L as the target (on the right), and R (the “is true on” relation) relates φ ∈ L to v ∈ V just in case v(φ) = T. In view of the one-to-correspondence between sets and characteristic functions, this relational connection is just a mild variant of the ∈-based relational connection considered above, in particular sharing with it the feature that it has conjunctive and disjunctive combinations on the right but not the left, and the feature that no two elements from the left bear the relation R to exactly the same elements on the right, and no two elements on the right have have exactly the same elements from the left bearing the relation R to them. To get some interesting logic under way, some of these features needed to be disturbed, though as we shall see, one of them—the existence of conjunctive combinations on the right—will prove surprisingly tenacious. If our interest lies in classical logic, we will be especially keen to discard most of (the above) V and concentrate only on boolean valuations, in the sense to be explained now. A function from {T, F}n to {T, F} is called an n-ary truth-function, and we say that an n-ary truth-function f is associated with the n-ary connective # of L on the valuation v (for L)—or alternatively, under these same conditions, that # is associated with f on v—just in case for all φ1,…,φn ∈ L:

v(#(φ1,…,φn)) = f(v(φ1),…,v(φn)).

We describe the connective # as truth-functional with respect to a class U of valuations when there is some f such that for each v ∈ U, f is associated with # on v, and as pseudo-truth-functional with respect to U when U is a union of classes of valuations with respect to each of which classes # is truth-functional.[4] A valuation v is #-boolean, speaking informally, when the expected truth-function is associated with # on v. More specifically, v, assumed to be a valuation for a language supporting the connectives to be mentioned here, is ∧-boolean when the binary truth-function f∧ with f∧(x, y) = T iff x = y = T is associated with ∧ on v, ∨-boolean when a similar association holds for ∨ and f∨ defined by f∨(x, y) = F iff x = y = F. We assume that the idea is now clear without providing separate definitions of “→-boolean”, “↔-boolean”, “¬-boolean”, “⊥-boolean”, etc. A boolean valuation for L is just a valuation for L which is #-boolean for each primitive connective # of L for which a notion of #-boolean valuation has been defined. (This is just a way of registering an intended truth-functional interpretation for the connectives # in question.) Similarly we call any connective # for which a notion of #-boolean valuation has been defined, a boolean connective, even when discussing its behaviour according to a logic not determined by a class of boolean valuations. (This terminology will be explained in due course.)

A set of truth-functions is strongly functionally complete if every truth-function can be obtained by composition from functions in the set, together with the projection functions, and weakly functionally complete if every truth-function can be obtained from functions in the set, together with the projection functions and the operation of passing from an (n+1)-ary function to an n-ary function by dropping an inessential argument (an argument on which the function does not depend, that is). This terminology is transferred from truth-functions to boolean connectives via the conventional association of such connectives with truth-functions described in the previous paragraph. Thus for example each of the sets {∧,¬}, {→,¬} is weakly functionally complete, while {→,⊥} is strongly functionally complete. This weak/strong distinction (for more on which, see Humberstone (1993)) is not usually registered in the literature, and functional completeness simpliciter is understood as weak functional completeness. These notions also apply in matrix semantics generally (see Section 5), and there are analogous notions of expressive completeness tailored to other areas; two distinct versions of expressive completeness in the area of intuitionistic logic (the distinction being orthogonal to the weak/strong distinction just drawn) are contrasted in Rousseau (1968), for example. None of these matters will occupy us further here.

It is often useful to take a more fine-grained look at the truth-functions in play in the above discussion. Assuming the identification of n-ary functions with certain (n+1)-ary relations and the latter with sets of ordered (n+1)-tuples, we use the term determinant for the elements of a truth-function. Thus the four determinants of the truth-function f→ associated with → on →-boolean valuations are ⟨T, T, T⟩, ⟨T, F, F⟩, ⟨F, T, T⟩, and ⟨F, F, T⟩. Note that the final entry is the ‘output’ value for the function concerned. Such determinants will occupy us extensively below.

In saying that a consequence relation ⊢ is determined by a class V of valuations what is meant that Γ ⊢ ψ if and only if for all v ∈ V, whenever v(φ) = T for each φ ∈ Γ, then v(ψ)= T. When ⊢ has been described by means of some proof system (some collection of rules), then the “only if” (“if”) direction of this claim amounts to the claim that ⊢ is sound (respectively, complete) with respect to V. Take the language whose sole primitive connective is ∧ and the class of ∧-boolean valuations. A simple proof system is provided by the rules indicated in the obvious way by the following figures:

(∧I)
φ   ψ
φ ∧ ψ
     (∧E)
φ ∧ ψ
φ
 , 
φ ∧ ψ
ψ

The rule on the left is usually called ∧-Introduction while the two on the right are collectively known as ∧-Elimination—thus “(∧I)” and “(∧E)”—because they take us, respectively, to and from a formula with ∧ as main connective, and they enable us to define a consequence relation, ⊢∧ in purely syntactic terms thus: Γ ⊢∧ φ just in case starting with formulas all of which lie in Γ, successive application of the above rules allows us to pass eventually to the formula φ. And then one can show, not only that this is the consequence relation determined by the class of ∧-boolean valuations—so that if one began with that class and sought a syntactic codification of the logic it gave rise to, one's search would be at an end—but further that the valuations consistent with ⊢∧ are precisely the ∧-boolean valuations. Here we calling v consistent with ⊢ when for no Γ, ψ, for which Γ ⊢ ψ, do we have v(φ) = T for all φ ∈ Γ while v(ψ) = F; the “but further” in the preceding sentence is explained by the fact that every consequence relation ⊢ is determined by the class Val(⊢) of all valuations consistent with ⊢, which in the case of ⊢∧ are precisely the ∧-boolean valuations. (See the discussion of Gabbay's result on the projection-conjunction truth-functions below for the extent of this phenomenon, which, for example, none of ∨, →, ¬ exhibits.) The significance of this is that if one started not with the class of ∧-boolean valuations (or any other kind of valuational semantics), but with the rules (∧I) and (∧E) themselves, then that class of valuations would force itself on one's attention anyway as the only class of valuations, preservation of truth on each of which coincided with derivability using those rules. (We return to this theme below, in connection with Carnap, by which time we will have traded in formula-to-formula rules for sequent-to-sequent rules, allowing for the convenient representation of inferences in which assumptions are discharged.) Moreover, the rules have a considerable claim to the status of rules in accordance with which one must reason if one is understanding ∧ as “and”, as providing a codification of the way in which conjunctive premisses and conclusions are reasoned from and to in natural day-to-day reasoning.

Now, as Gerhard Gentzen observed, when we come to formulate similarly compelling principles for introducing and eliminating the other connectives, we find ourselves having to make reference to the discharging of assumptions temporarily made for the sake of argument. Such is the case for instance with formulating an introduction rule for → and with formulating an elimination rule for ∨. In the case of the former rule, for example, Gentzen took it that the way to derive φ → ψ is to assume φ and use the various rules and other assumptions to derive ψ, at which point the rule (also called Conditional Proof) allows us to claim that we have derived φ → ψ from the remaining assumptions, without having to record this conclusion as depending on φ (as ψ itself did before the rule was applied). Thus to extend the present approach, known as natural deduction, from ∧ to these and other connectives, it is necessary to keep track not only of what formulas we are dealing with at a given stage but also of the set of initial formulas, or assumptions, on which that formula depends. We want to say, in the case of the rule just described, that it entitles us to pass from ψ, as depending on Γ ∪ {φ}, to φ → ψ, as depending on Γ. The ordered pair of a finite set of formulas and an individual formula, ⟨Γ, φ⟩ whose first entry records the set of formulas on which its second entry depends, we write in the more suggestive notation Γ ≻ φ, and call a sequent, or more explicitly, a sequent of the logical framework Set-Fmla. For the variant framework Set-Fmla0, we allow also the case in which there is no formula to the right of the “≻”. Some principles for reasoning about sequents which do not involve any specific connectives and were called by Gentzen, structural rules (as opposed to operational rules) are the following, which are respectively a zero-premiss, a one-premiss and a two-premiss sequent-to-sequent rule:

(Id) φ ≻ φ
(Weakening)
Γ ≻ ψ
Γ,φ ≻ ψ
(Cut)
Γ,φ ≻ ψ   Δ ≻ φ
Γ, Δ ≻ ψ

As the notation makes clear, we use the same shortcuts in formulations involving the regular turnstile (⊢) as for the current variant (≻), despite the difference in role played by these two symbols: the former is a metalinguistic predicate and the latter a device for separating the two sides of a sequent. (“≻”, arranging formulas into sequents, is, as Lemmon (1965) says of his corresponding notation, the formal analogue of the word “therefore”, which arranges sentences into arguments. The former is, by contrast, for making comments about such arguments—for example to the effect that they are valid. Of course there is a little slack in the analogy for Set-Fmla, since we allow the case where there are no premisses.) Any collection Σ of sequents which is closed under the structural rules above gives rise to a corresponding (finitary) consequence relation: Γ ⊢Σ φ iff for some finite Γ0 ⊆ Γ, we have Γ0≻ φ ∈ Σ. We should also have a sequent-based analogue of the notion of a valuation's being consistent with a consequence relation; accordingly we say that a sequent Γ ≻ φ holds on the valuation v just in case we do not have v(ψ) = T for each ψ ∈ Γ while also v(φ) = F. (When Γ is empty, the sequent holds on v just in case v(φ) = T. It would be uncouth to speak of a sequent as being true on a valuation, however, just as one would not speak of the truth of an argument. Such usages are on a par with, and closely allied to, the mistaken conception of ≻ as a kind of connective.)

We can now formulate the desired →-introduction rule so that the assumption discharge feature is visible in what happens on the left of the sequent-separator as we move from premiss-sequent to conclusion-sequent. We write the elimination rule alongside in a similar notation; included also are the natural deduction rules for ∨; the earlier rules for ∧ should be imagined as re-written along similar lines, with assumption-dependencies made explicit:

(→I)
Γ,φ ≻ ψ
Γ ≻ φ → ψ
(→E)
Γ ≻ φ → ψ   Δ ≻ φ
Γ, Δ ≻ ψ
(∨I)
Γ ≻ φ
Γ ≻ φ ∨ ψ
 , 
Γ ≻ ψ
Γ ≻ φ ∨ ψ
(∨E)
Γ ≻ φ ∨ ψ   Δ,φ ≻ χ   Θ,ψ ≻ χ
Γ, Δ, Θ ≻ χ

Along with the ∧ rules reformulated in the above sequent-to-sequent style, and the structural rule (Id)—(Weakening) and (Cut) being derivable—these rules render provable exactly those sequents in {∧,∨,→}-fragment of intuitionistic logic, while for the corresponding fragment of classical logic, one would need to add a further principle governing implication, such as the following subcontrariety rule:

(Subc→) 
Γ, φ → ψ ≻ χ    Γ, φ ≻ χ
Γ ≻ χ

(Equivalently, in view of Weakening, one could give a formulation with “Δ” as a set-variable for the right sequent premiss, and carry both “Γ” and “Δ” down to the conclusion-sequent, as in the formulation of (→E) above.) In the terminology of Dummett (1991) all of the rules we have seen are pure (their schematic formulation involves mention only of a single connective) and simple (each formulation mentions it only once), this last rule is also oblique: a discharged assumption has the connective in question as its main connective. One can trade in this obliqueness for a loss of simplicity, changing the →-elimination rule from the familiar Modus Ponens principle above to a version incorporating Peirce's Law (“(p → q) → p ≻ p”), due to Kanger:[5]

Γ ≻ φ → ψ   Δ ≻ (φ → χ) → φ
Γ, Δ ≻ ψ

or sacrifice purity and have a zero-premiss rule ≻ φ ∨ (φ → ψ), or again just leave the implicational rules as they are and rely on further rules (not given here) governing negation to make up the shortfall and render such classically but not intuitionistically acceptable →-sequents—such as Peirce's Law above—provable with their aid. (The same tensions would then arise for the ¬ rules, if one regards obliqueness as undesirable, with “double negation elimination” principles abandoning simplicity, or “excluded middle” principles, abandoning purity. Note that by a ‘classically acceptable sequent’ here is meant a sequent holding on all boolean valuations.) An alternative for capturing the classical logic of → is to change from the logical framework Set-Fmla to Set-Set, in which finite (possibly empty) sets of formulas appear on the right of the ≻, just as on the left. Then the above →-Introduction rule can be remain intact, but with a set variable to collect side-formulas on the right: from Γ, φ≻ψ, Δ to Γ≻φ→ψ, Δ. (Suitable modifications should also be made to the remaining rules in this case.) These ‘multiple-succedent’ sequents are more popularly associated with a different approach to logic from the natural deduction approach (though they have often appeared in this setting), namely the sequent calculus approach, in which instead of being inserted or removed from the right of the ≻, by suitable introduction or elimination rules, together with the possible discharge of assumptions, the rules—again, ideally, pure and simple—always insert a connective, either to the left or the right, of the “≻”. The left insertion rules do the work of the elimination rules of the natural deduction approach, while the right insertion rules do the work of—indeed, are just—the natural deduction introduction rules. The left insertion rules, (# Left) for # ∈ {∧,∨,→} are then as follows for the classical case, with the right insertion rules (# Right) being the natural deduction introduction rules as above, with a set-variable on the right of the ≻ for the classical Set-Set case:

(∧ Left)
Γ,φ ≻ Δ
Γ,φ ∧ ψ ≻ Δ
 , 
Γ,ψ ≻ Δ
Γ,φ ∧ ψ ≻ Δ
(∨ Left)
Γ,φ ≻ Δ   Γ′, ψ ≻ Δ′
Γ,Γ′,φ ∨ ψ ≻ Δ, Δ′
(→ Left)
Γ ≻ φ, Δ   Γ′,ψ ≻ Δ′
Γ,Γ′,φ → ψ ≻ Δ, Δ′

For formulations restricted to Set-Fmla0, and thus suitable for the intuitionistic sequent calculus, we require that Δ in (∧ Left) contains at most one formula, and for (∨ Left) and (→ Left), that Δ ∪ Δ′ contains at most one formula. Indeed, one easily sees that using the structural rules mentioned earlier and the operational rules described here, there will always be exactly one formula, since proofs all begin with (Id) and no rule removes all formulas from the right-hand side (or ‘succedent’) in the transition from premiss sequents to conclusion sequent. This changes if we add the rules for negation, here giving both the left and the right insertion rules, initially for the Set-Set case:

(¬ Left)  
Γ ≻ φ Δ
Γ,¬φ ≻ Δ
       (¬ Right)  
Γ,φ ≻ Δ
Γ ≻ ¬φ, Δ

A Set-Set sequent Γ≻ Δ holds on a valuation v if and only if it is not the case that v verifies every formula in Γ while falsifying every formula in Δ; note that this coincides with the definition of “holding on v” given for Set-Fmla in the case in which Δ = {ψ} for some ψ. Similarly, we have the notion of a generalized consequence relation in which suitably two-sided versions of the conditions definitive of consequence relations are given, which can be found in Shoesmith and Smiley (1978), Chapter 2, for example (under the name ‘multiple-conclusion consequence relation’). If ⊩ is such a relation on a language L then an L-valuation v is said to be consistent with ⊩ when there do not exist Γ, Δ, with v(φ) = T for all φ ∈ Γ and v(ψ) = F for all ψ ∈ Δ. Sometimes formulations appear below with the phrase “(generalized) consequence relation”, meaning that the claim being made or considered applies both in the case of consequence relations and in the case of generalized consequence relations.

One should distinguish sharply between logical frameworks, that is, choices as to what kind of thing a sequent is (e.g., Set-Fmla vs. Set-Set), on the one hand, and approaches to logic, that is, choices as to what kind of sequent-to-sequent rules are to be used (e.g., natural deduction vs. sequent calculus), on the other. Gentzen (1934) used Set-Set for a classical sequent calculus and Set-Fmla for the intuitionistic case. (More accurately, since he had finite sequences of formulas in mind rather than sets, and in the latter case allowed empty but not multiple succedents, we should really say something long the lines of Seq-Seq and Seq-Fmla0, respectively. Additional structural rules are then needed to allow permutation of formulas in a sequence.) Rudolf Carnap (1943) had a rather different reason for passing from Set-Fmla to Set-Set, one which is semantically based rather than grounded in considerations of proof-theoretic elegance.

Let us forget about → and ¬ and the rules governing them, and consider the formulas constructed with the aid only of ∧ and ∨. On sequents of Set-Fmla in this fragment, classical and intuitionistic logic agree, and the consequence relation concerned—⊢∧,∨, we may call it—is the consequence relation determined by the class of all ∧- and ∨-boolean valuations. Carnap's point is one anticipated earlier with the remark that every v ∈ Val(⊢∧) is ∧-boolean, which extends to the case of ⊢∧,∨: all valuations in Val(⊢∧,∨) are ∧-boolean, but they are not all ∨-boolean, for the simple reason that for any consequence relation ⊢, Val(⊢) is always closed under conjunctive combinations, and it is easy to find ∨-boolean u, v, with u ⋅ v not ∨-boolean.[6] It is interesting to see this as an appeal to the considerations of Section 1 as follows. Consider the binary relational connection between the set of formulas in a language one of whose connectives is ∨ and the class of boolean valuations, with the relation is true on. We have disjunctive combinations on the left, with φ + ψ as φ ∨ ψ, since the valuations on the right are all ∨-boolean; therefore we cannot in general have conjunctive combinations on the left, since the crossover condition is not satisfied for this connection. The closure claim applies quite generally, with ∏ V ∈ Val(⊢) whenever V ⊆ Val(⊢). This fact appears in the philosophical literature in the fact that supervaluations over classes of bivalent valuations deliver the same consequence relation as the original valuations, which is accordingly classical when the valuations are boolean. (Supervaluations are supposed to be non-bivalent, in verifying those formulas verified by all the underlying valuations and falsifying those formulas false on all the underlying valuations, with those in neither category being neither true nor false on the supervaluation. But everything in this definition after the words “verified by all the underlying valuations” is mere rhetoric, since all that matters—for a sequent's holding on a valuation or a valuation's being consistent with a consequence relation—is truth-preservation; setting it to one side, we can identify the supervaluation over V with ∏ V. Likewise in the case of ‘subvaluations’—as in Hyde (2005)—where it is ∑ V that would be relevant.) A special case arises with V = ∅, for which ∏ V is the unique valuation vT assigning T to every formula (of the language in question, to which the claim of uniqueness is understood as relativized).

One may wonder which truth-functions are like that associated (on ∧-boolean valuations) with ∧ in this respect. More precisely, let ⊢ be the consequence relation determined by the class of valuations on each of which an n-ary connective #f is associated with the n-ary truth-function f. Our question is: for which choices of f does ⊢ enforce the interpretation of #f as f in the sense that on every v ∈ Val(⊢), #f is associated with f. This question was answered in Dov Gabbay (1978) and (1981) (Chapter 1, Section 3) as follows. Say that f (as above) is a projection-conjunction truth-function just in case for some J ⊆ {1,…,n} we have, for all x1,…,xn (xi ∈ {T, F}):

f(x1,…,xn) = T if and only if for all j ∈ J, xj = T.

Then the truth-functions f for which every valuation consistent with ⊢ (as above) associates #f with f are precisely the projection-conjunction truth-functions. (Gabbay calls #f, as it behaves according to ⊢, strongly classical in these cases, though his own definition is not formulated in these terms.) By way of example: when n = 1, these are the identity and the constant-true functions, while for n = 2, they are the first projection, second projection, constant true and (boolean) conjunction truth-functions. (The constant true cases arise by taking J as ∅.) The remaining 12 binary truth-functions thus exhibit the behaviour we saw with the disjunction truth-function; the corresponding connectives are what Gabbay calls weakly classical: determined by a class of valuations over which the connective is associated with a certain truth-function despite the existence of further consistent valuation on which it is not so associated. It is easy to see that the latter phenomenon does not arise in the case of generalized consequence relations ⊩, since we can easily write down unconditional conditions on such relations which enforce the association with a particular truth-function on valuations in Val(⊩). This is best seen as proceeding determinant by determinant. The unenforceable determinant in the case of disjunction is ⟨F, F, F⟩, dictating that when the disjuncts have the values listed in the first two positions, the disjunction has the value listed in the final position. This determinant induces in a familiar way (e.g., Segerberg (1982), §3.3) the following condition on ⊩: that for all φ, ψ, we have φ ∨ ψ ⊩ φ, ψ. Alternatively put, in Set-Set, as opposed to Set-Fmla, there is a set of formulas holding on precisely the ∨-boolean valuations, namely that containing, for all formulas φ, ψ, the sequents φ ≻ φ ∨ ψ, and ψ ≻ φ ∨ ψ, and—the new case not already available in Set-Fmla—φ ∨ ψ ≻ φ, ψ. In view of this, we can say that in Set-Set though not in Set-Fmla, the class of ∨-boolean valuations is sequent-definable, and the same goes for connectives associated with all the other truth-functions not meeting the projection-conjunction test (such as negation and material implication). As the ∨ example makes clear, by contrast with the case of consequence relations, Val(⊩), for a generalized consequence relation ⊩, need not be closed under conjunctive combinations.[7] Again, one can see this in the light of the considerations of Section 1, thinking of the relational connection between Set-Set sequents and arbitrary valuations, with the relation being ‘holds on’. This connection supplies disjunctive combinations on the left, with σ + σ′ being the least common weakening of σ and σ′.[8] Thus it cannot also supply conjunctive combinations on the right, since it does not satisfy the crossover condition.

This approximately Carnapian concern with sequent-definability—in particular the exclusion of unwanted non-boolean valuations—can be taken to a higher level by moving from questions about sequents and the valuations they hold, to questions about rules and the valuations they preserve the property of holding on, as we shall see in Section 3, after making some further points about the apparatus of consequence relations, or logics in the framework Set-Fmla. The determinant-induced conditions on generalized consequence relations alluded to above can be converted into conditions on consequence relations in a straightforward way, illustrated here in the case of negation, with the condition

for all φ: φ, ¬φ ⊩ ∅

(induced by ⟨T, F⟩) becoming

for all φ, ψ,: φ, ¬φ ⊢ ψ

and the condition

for all φ: ⊩ φ, ¬φ

(induced by ⟨F, T⟩) turning into the conditional condition on consequence relations ⊩:

for all Γ, φ, ψ, if Γ, φ ⊢ ψ and Γ, ¬φ ⊢ ψ then Γ ⊢ ψ.

In a proof system in Set-Fmla such conditional requirements emerge as sequent-to-sequent rules, closure under which (along with containing all the sequents corresponding to the unconditional requirements) will suffice to secure completeness—in this case that any unprovable sequent fails to hold on some ¬-boolean valuation—without the strong classicality property of having the provable sequents hold only on such valuations. (The process just described transforms the Set-Set condition, φ ∨ ψ ≻ φ, ψ (all φ, ψ), induced by the Set-Fmla unenforceable ∨ determinant ⟨F, F, F⟩, into the conditional condition of closure under the rule (∨E).) If a generalized consequence relation ⊩ with a boolean connective # in its language satisfies all the conditions induced by the determinants of the associated truth-function we call ⊩ #-classical. Similarly for a consequence relation which satisfies the conditions on consequence relations—conditional conditions included—derived, as just described, from these determinant-induced conditions on generalized consequence relations. (These versions of #-classicality can often be simplified on a case-by-case basis. For example, the ∧-classicality of a consequence relation or generalized consequence relation—we use the former notation here—is equivalent to its being the case that for all φ, ψ, we have (1) φ, ψ ⊢ φ ∧ ψ, (2) φ ∧ ψ ⊢ φ, and (3) φ ∧ ψ ⊢ ψ. Here we see a three-part condition, instead of the four-part condition comprising the conditions induced by each of the four determinants.)

Consideration of the determinant-induced conditions on generalized consequence relations allows us incidentally to observe, somewhat surprisingly, that consequence relations (and the Set-Fmla framework) manage to distinguish the logics of any two truth-functions of the same arity. More precisely, suppose that f and g are distinct n-ary truth-functions, # is an n-ary connective, and Vf and Vg are the classes of valuations on which, respectively, f and g are associated with #; then the consequence relations determined by Vf and Vg are distinct. By way of illustration, suppose that n = 3 and f and g differ on some determinant beginning with T, F, F. (Thus we are considering the case in which the first component of a #-compound is true on a given valuation and the second and third are false.) Without loss of generality, we can assume that ⟨T, F, F, T⟩ ∈ f while ⟨T, F, F, F⟩ ∈ g. The conditions on a generalized consequence relation ⊩ induced by these determinants are respectively φ ⊩ ψ, χ, #(φ, ψ, χ) and φ, #(φ, ψ, χ) ⊩ ψ, χ. Thus in particular, taking φ as p and each of ψ, χ, as q, for the generalized consequence relation ⊩f, say, determined by Vf and that, ⊩g, determined by Vg, we have:

p ⊩f q, #(p, q, q)    and    p, #(p, q, q) ⊩g q.

Note that p, #(p, q, q) ⊮f q, since otherwise it would follow (by the ‘cut’ condition on generalized consequence relations) from the first inset ⊩-statement here that p ⊩f q, which is not the case. Thus in view of the second ⊩-statement, ⊩f and ⊩g differ on the sequent σ = p, #(p, q, q)≻ q, since σ ∈ ⊩g while σ ∉ ⊩f. But σ is a sequent of Set-Fmla, so the consequence relations, ⊢f and ⊢g, say, determined respectively by Vf and Vg also differ (namely, on σ). We have worked through a simple illustration of the general result claimed above, but this case is sufficiently representative for the general proof to be reconstructed.

Indeed the real moral is more general still. We did not need to use, in our worked example, more than the fact that there was some determinant respected by every valuation in Vf with the opposite determinant respected by every valuation in Vg, where V respects a determinant ⟨x1,…,xn,xn+1⟩ for # (with each xi ∈ {T, F}) just in case for all formulas φ1,…,φn, v(φi) = xi for i = 1,…, n implies v(#(φ1,…,φn) = xn+1, and determinants are opposite if they differ in precisely their final positions. (Actually, inspection of the worked example shows that we also need the classes playing the role of Vf and Vg also to contain enough valuations to assign different truth-values to any pair of distinct propositional variables.) Take the 1-ary connective ☐ of any familiar modal logic (e.g., S5), for example. We expect it to satisfy the determinant ⟨F, F⟩, in the sense that the appropriate consequence relation should satisfy the condition induced by this determinant, since what is necessarily true is true—and thus if φ is false, ☐φ should be false—while we do not want any determinant of the form ⟨T, x⟩ to be satisfied. In this case we can describe ☐ as partially determined according to the consequence relation in question. On the other hand, if a consequence relation ⊢ (or a generalized consequence relation ⊩) satisfies, for each n-tuple of truth-values, the condition induced by exactly one determinant for the n-ary connective #, whose first n entries are as given by that n-tuple (the final, n+1st, entry being either a T or an F), then we say # is fully determined according to ⊢ (or ⊩). By the determinant-induced conditions on a consequence relation here is meant the conditions on a consequence relation derived as explained (or at least illustrated) above from the conditions directly determinant-induced conditions on a generalized consequence relation. As one might expect, this property of connectives relative to consequence relations has an intimate relation with the similar property introduced at the start of this section:

A connective # in the language of a consequence relation ⊢ is fully determined according to ⊢ if and only if there is some class of valuations V such that ⊢ is determined by V and # is truth-functional with respect to V.

Note that the two occurrences of the word ‘determined’ here mean quite different things. “Fully determined”, as defined above, is a variation on Segerberg's terminology in his (1982) of ‘type-determined’, varied so as to lend itself to other modifications—partially determined, completely undetermined, overdetermined,… (though this last will not be getting attention here)—while the second occurrence of the word is the usual sound and complete sense of “determined”. Turning to generalized consequence relations, we find the connection to be more intimate still:

A connective # in the language of a generalized consequence relation ⊩ is fully determined according to ⊩ if and only if # is truth-functional with respect to Val(⊩).

This implies the statement given for consequence relations (putting “⊩” in place of “⊢”) since a generalized consequence relation, like a consequence relation, is always determined by the class of all valuations consistent with it. (But only the weaker statement above is available for consequence relations, as such cases as that of ∨ illustrates, since the consequence relation determined by the class of ∨-boolean valuations—with respect to to which ∨ is by definition truth-functional—is also determined by other classes of valuations, with respect to it is not.) Indeed another way of putting the contrast between the consequence relations claim above and the generalized consequence relations claim is that while for consequence relations #‘s being fully determined according to ⊢ is equivalent some class of valuations which determines ⊢ having # truth-functional with respect to it, for generalized consequence relations we can say that #‘s being fully determined according to ⊩ is equivalent every class of valuations which determines ⊩ having # truth-functional with respect to it.

Along with truth-functionality, we also included a definition of pseudo-truth-functionality with respect to V. A simple way of seeing the relation between these two concepts is in an ∀/∃ scope contrast (in which “f” ranges over truth-functions of the same arity as #): # is truth-functional with respect to V when

∃f∀v ∈ V[f is associated with # on v],

whereas # is pseudo-truth-functional with respect to V when

∀v ∈ V∃f[f is associated with # on v].

It is natural to ask after a syntactical condition related to pseudo-truth-functionality in the same way(s) as full determination is related to truth-functionality. Say that an n-ary connective # is left-extensional in its ith position (1 ≤ i ≤ n) or right-extensional in its ith position, according to a generalized consequence relation ⊩, when the condition (LEi) or (REi) is satisfied, respectively, for all formulas φ1,…,φn,ψ in the language of ⊩ we have:

LEi : φi, ψ, #(φ1,…,φn) ⊩ #(φ1,…,φi−1,ψ,φi+1,…,φn),
REi : #(φ1,…,φn) ⊩ #(φ1,…,φi−1,ψ,φi+1,…,φn), φi, ψ.

# is left-extensional (right-extensional) according to ⊩ if it is left-extensional (respectively, right-extensional) in its ith position for each i (1 ≤ i ≤ n), and finally # is extensional according to ⊩ when # is both left- and right-extensional according to ⊩. For n = 1 we drop the subscript, the above conditions reducing to (LE) and (RE):

LE : φ, ψ, #φ ⊩ #ψ,
RE : #φ⊩ #ψ, φ, ψ.

Thus (LE) requires that each v ∈ Val(⊩) “treats truths alike” when they are embedded under #, in the sense that when v(φ) = v(ψ) = T, then v(#φ) = v(#ψ), while (RE) requires that falsehoods be treated alike in that v(φ) = v(ψ) = F likewise implies that v(#φ) = v(#ψ). (It may help to remark that for ↔-classical ⊢ together these amount to requiring that φ ↔ ψ ⊢ #φ ↔ #ψ. But we are trying to keep the discussion ‘pure’ so that definitions make sense even when the connective—here #—with the property being defined is the sole connective in the language.) The conditions (LEi) already make sense as conditions on consequence relations (writing ⊢ for ⊩) since there is a single formula on the right, and we will speak of # as left-extensional according to ⊢ when they are all satisfied, while the conditions (REi) need to be converted into conditional conditions as above in the discussion of determinant-induced conditions. We will illustrate this only for the n = 1 case, with (RE) becoming (RE′), understood as demanding for all Γ, φ, ψ, χ:

RE′ : If Γ, #ψ ⊢ χ and Γ , φ ⊢ χ and Γ , ψ ⊢ χ, then Γ, #φ ⊢ χ.

Taking it that the intention is clear for the general case what (RE′i) should be as a condition on consequence relations, we say that # is right-extensional according to ⊢ when (RE′i) is satisfied for each i up to the arity of #, and that # is extensional according to ⊢ just in case # is both left- and right-extensional according to ⊢. Then paralleling the above results for truth-functionality are the following for pseudo-truth-functionality:

A connective # in the language of a consequence relation ⊢ is extensional according to ⊢ if and only if there is some class of valuations V such that ⊢ is determined by V and # is pseudo-truth-functional with respect to V.
A connective # in the language of a generalized consequence relation ⊩ is extensional according to ⊩ if and only if # is pseudo-truth-functional with respect to Val(⊩).

Whether for consequence relations or for generalized consequence relations, we have the following—in general, irreversible—implications for the three properties of being fully determined, being extensional, and being congruential (as explained below) according to any given (generalized) consequence relation:[9]

fully determined ⇒ extensional ⇒ congruential.

where this last concept is defined by saying that # is congruential in the ith position according to a consequence relation or generalized consequence relation ⊢ or ⊩ (we state the condition only using the “⊢” notation) just in case for all formulas φ1,…,φn,ψ:

φi ⊣⊢ ψ implies #(φ1,…,φn) ⊣⊢ #(φ1,…,φi−1,ψ,φi+1,…,φn),

and calling # congruential according to ⊢ when # is congruential in each of its positions according to ⊢. Clearly a consequence relation is congruential in the sense of Section 1—which of course also makes sense for generalized consequence relations—precisely when each primitive connective in its language is congruential in every position according to it. A similar lifting of properties of connectives—‘according to’ (generalized) consequence relations—can be made in the other cases too, for example calling a consequence relation fully determined when each of the primitive connectives of its language is fully determined according to it. Thus we may say that the consequence relation ⊢CL of classical logic (with any given stock of primitive connectives—though we will not further decorate the notation to indicate a particular fragment) is fully determined and thus also extensional (and congruential), while the consequence relation ⊢I L of intuitionistic logic is congruential but not extensional, since for example, ¬, is not right-extensional according to ⊢I L. The consequence relation determined by the well-known three-element matrix of Łukasiewicz is not even congruential, since (again) ¬ is not congruential according to this relation. There is a weaker property than extensionality as here defined (for the sake of the above connection with pseudo-truth-functionality) which properly implies left extensionality but not right extensionality and which, unlike left extensionality itself, implies congruentiality. We could define #, here taken for illustrative purposes again as 1-ary, to be weakly extensional according to a consequence relation ⊢ when for all Γ, φ, ψ:

Γ, φ ⊢ ψ and Γ, ψ ⊢ φ imply Γ, #φ ⊢ # ψ.

Thus weak extensionality is congruentiality ‘with side formulas’ (collected into Γ). The obvious adaptation of this notion to generalized consequence relations would be to allow side-formulas on the right too (replacing the above“⊢” by “⊩” and adding a set variable “Δ” to the right-hand sides, that is): this turns out to be equivalent to extensionality for generalized consequence relations as defined above in terms of (LEi) and (REi). ⊢I L is weakly extensional in this sense, and weak extensionality according to ⊢ ⊇ ⊢I L is a property of some theoretical significance for the case in which the language of ⊢ adds new connectives in the spirit of the original intuitionistic primitives. (See §3.2 and subsections 4.37–8 of Humberstone (2011a) for further background, and, for an articulation of what is at issue here from an algebraic perspective, Caicedo and Cignoli (2001), Caicedo (2004), and Ertola Biraben and San Martín (2011).)

Returning to the subject of extensionality, one area in which extensional but not fully determined connectives arises is when one takes hybrids of the latter. By the hybrid of disjunction and conjunction, for example, understanding ∨ and ∧ to have the inferential powers conferred on them by a particular logic, is meant a binary connective whose inferential powers are those shared ∧ and ∨. (See Rautenberg (1989) for this example, and Rautenberg (1991) and references therein for more in this vein.) Note that the connectives hybridized and the resulting hybrid are connectives in the ‘logically loaded’ sense of Section 1 above.

There are various ways of defining the hybridization process depend on how much generality one wants, but the following minimally general definition is the easiest to work with. Start with two (generalized) consequence relations each on the same language, that language having a single primitive connective, #, say. The hybrid connective is then # as it behaves according to the intersection of the (generalized) consequence relations. This way of defining things requires us to re-notate the connectives to be hybridized. Thus sticking with the example just mentioned, we consider a copy of the pure ∧ fragment of ⊢CL, called ⊢∧ earlier in this section, but writing # for ∧—but let us still call this consequence relation ⊢∧—and similarly with the ∨ fragment. We are then interested in the behaviour of # according to ⊢∧ ∩ ⊢∨. (Where V∧ and V∨ are the classes of valuations on which # is associated respectively with the boolean ∧ truth-function and with the boolean ∨ truth-function, our intersective consequence relation is that determined by V∧ ∪ V∨.) This behaviour includes the semilattice properties of idempotence, commutativity and associativity, for example, since these are common to boolean disjunction and conjunction. This particular hybrid connective is partially determined, since for example φ, ψ ≻ φ # ψ (a sequent formulation of the condition induced on consequence relations by ⟨T, T, T⟩) belongs to ⊢∧ ∩ ⊢∨. This by itself does not show that the hybrid is not fully determined, however, and to avoid entanglement with some issues about rules, this point is best illustrated in terms of the corresponding generalized consequence relations and their intersection, the latter satisfying neither of the conditions induced by the determinants beginning T, F: for ⟨T, F, T⟩, the condition that φ, φ # ψ ⊩ ψ (failing for # as ∨) or the determinant ⟨T, F, F⟩, for which the induced condition is φ ⊩ φ # ψ, ψ (failing for # as ∧). (Amongst issues about non-zero-premiss sequent-to-sequent rules that call for care is that fact that while for any such rule under which each of the intersected consequence relations is closed, their intersection is likewise closed, the converse is false: the hybrid consequence relation may be closed under rules for which the originals are not. In the present instance the rule: from φ ≻ ψ to ψ ≻ φ is an example. Similarly for generalized consequence relations the rule: from Γ ≻ Δ to Δ ≻ Γ makes the same point. This second version shows that the current example of hybridization, as conducted in Set-Set, yields a symmetric generalized consequence relation.[10])

Let us note in view of the recent reference to ⊢∧ ∩ ⊢∨, there has been an interest in how one might form something like the union rather than the intersection of the two consequence relations involved here. Not quite the union, since that would not be a consequence relation, but something answering to the intuitive idea of a consequence relation embodying the combined logic of conjunction and disjunction. (This is the theme of Béziau and Coniglio (2010), further taken up in Humberstone (2015).) The situation is not exactly dual to that of hybrids, to which topic we return in the folowing paragraph, because the envisaged hybrid logic contains one connective with the common logical properties of (in the present instance) conjunction and disjunction, whereas the combined logic is based on the language with the two connectives. (The precise dual would be a consequence relation on a language with a single connective, roughly speaking giving that connective all the logical powers possessed by either disjunction or conjunction, and by a result of Wolfgang Rautenberg cited below, according to this consequence relation any formula follows from any other. Indeed, this particular instance of Rautenberg's observation is already well known in the literature on Tonk, recalled in §3 below: any consequence relation in a language including a binary connective which satisfies, relative to that consequence relation, both an ∨-Introduction condition and also an ∧-Elimination condition will be one of these trivial consequence relations.

The hybrid of two fully determined connectives may even be completely undetermined (satisfy no determinant-induced conditions at all, that is). This will be the case, for example, if we hybridize not conjunction and disjunction, but conjunction and negated conjunction (sometimes called nand). By using negation in this way, we prevent any overlap in the determinant-induced conditions which are satisfied by the hybrid, though there still remain some non-trivial properties (commutativity, for example) as well as extensionality—the point of this mention of hybrids—since any hybrid of fully determined connectives will still be extensional (according to the intersection, that is). Of course, one can also hybridize connectives which are not themselves fully, or even partially determined—for example, one could investigate the common properties of ☐ and ♢ according to the smallest normal modal logic (commonly called K), though this example would for its most natural development require us to go beyond the simple account of hybrids given here, since it would have to attend to the simultaneous presence of the boolean connectives alongside these modal operators. A better known modal example of hybrids is that of the ☐ operator in Łukasiewicz's Ł-modal logic (not that Łukasiewicz used this notation for his necessity operator), which is a hybrid of 1-ary connectives for the 1-place identity and constant-false truth-functions. (See Chapter 1 of Prior (1957) on this point; further references may be found in Section 5.)

The hybrid of two connectives is a subconnective of each of them in the sense that whatever sequents (of the logical framework in play) are provable for it are provable for them. And conversely—but for the moment the subconnective relation itself will be the focus of attention. Intuitionistic negation is in this sense a subconnective, indeed a proper subconnective (in the sense that we do not have the converse) of classical negation. As with hybrids, there are various options, of differing degrees of generality in their application, for defining this relation. In the case of a language with only a single primitive connective, #, we can say that # as it behaves according to (e.g.) the consequence relation ⊢ is a subconnective of # as it behaves according to ⊢′ just in case ⊢ ⊆ ⊢′. If we want to allow different connectives of the same arity, say # and #′, then we can put this instead by saying that σ(#) ∈ ⊢ only if σ(#′) ∈ ⊢′, for all σ(#), understanding the latter to denote a sequent with various occurrences of # in its constituent formulas, with σ(#′) the result of replacing all such occurrences by #′. This kind of formulation lends itself to wider applicability since we can allow other connectives in the formulas of σ(#), provided these are in the language of ⊢′. There is no reason to restrict attention to primitive connectives in making such comparisons. For example, each of ☐ and ☐☐ is a subconnective of the other in several well-known modal logics, as is shown in Zolin (2000), where logics are developed axiomatically as sets of formulas (sequents of the logical framework Fmla, as we would say[11] so the “σ(#)” would become “φ(#)” and the point is that in the logics concerned φ(☐) and φ(☐☐) are always equi-provable—though in the interesting cases (e.g., those of K, KT, KTB), not provably equivalent. Note that this is an intra-logical application of the subconnective idea (corresponding to the case of ⊢ = ⊢′ above, for which we definitely need to work with notationally distinguished # and #′). Zolin calls such mutual subconnectives analogous (‘analogous modalities’). A philosophically famous example of this phenomenon from bimodal (or more specifically, doxastic-epistemic) logic was reported in Byrd (1973).

Earlier in this section we saw that, where Vf and Vg are the classes of valuations for a language with n-ary connective # on which distinct truth-functions f and g are associated with # respectively, the consequence relations determined by Vf and Vg were always distinct. In the present terminology, this means that either # as it behaves according to the first of these consequence relations is not a subconnective of # as it behaves according to the second, or vice versa. This is obvious for generalized consequence relations as one can read off the difference from the unconditional conditions induced by the determinants of f and g, but we saw (in a worked example) that such differences are also guaranteed to emerge at the relatively cruder level of consequence relations. A stronger conclusion can be drawn from Theorem 4 of Rautenberg (1981) (see also Rautenberg (1985), p. 4), which will not be proved here, and for the statement of which we need to explain that a non-trivial consequence relation ⊢ is one for which there exist formulas φ, ψ in the language of ⊢ such that φ ⊬ ψ; for some of the matrix terminology here, see Section 5:

Let M be any two-element matrix with one designated value. Then the consequence relation ⊨M determined by M is not properly included in any non-trivial substitution-invariant consequence relation on the same language.

As one very special case of this maximality result, in which the algebra reduct of M has only a single fundamental operation (f, as above, say), we get a stronger conclusion about the consequence relations ⊢f and ⊢g determined by Vf and Vg than our earlier conclusion that these consequence relations are distinct: we get the conclusion that neither is included in the other. Taking the A and D of M = (A, D) as ({T, F}, f) and {T}, the consequence relation ⊢f is what Rautenberg is calling ⊨M, and if this were properly included in ⊢g we should have a contradiction with the above result, since the latter consequence relation is certainly non-trivial and substitution-invariant. Thus informally speaking, even in the relatively undiscriminating framework Set-Fmla, the logic of one truth-function never subsumes that of another. Less informally: even in Set-Fmla, a fully determined connective is never a proper subconnective of another fully determined connective.

We conclude this section with two observations prompted by this result. The first concerns whether anything was gained by our earlier looking at the argument for the weaker result (understood in the light of the above conventions) to the effect that, f ≠ g implies ⊢f ≠ ⊢g. The answer to this question is that although the result is weaker, the proof yields something stronger: any difference in determinants yields a difference in unconditional determinant-induced conditions. Considered as sequents (with propositional variables replacing the schematic letters in the induced conditions) these have a very special form, and, transferring Dummett's terminology (seen earlier in this section) for rules, across to sequents, we note that they are all included in the class of pure and simple sequents: sequents in which there is only one connective to occur and it occurs only once in the sequent. Suitably abstracting from our earlier worked example, we can see that any connectives satisfying the conditions induced by even one pair of opposite determinants (whether or not any remaining determinant-induced conditions are satisfied) are bound to differ on a pair of pure and simple sequents. But the analogue of Rautenberg's result does not hold in this form: that the set of pure and simple sequents satisfied by the one and the set satisfied by the other are incomparable with respect to inclusion. For example, consider the case of the 1-ary truth-functions boolean negation and the constant-false function. We can cite #p ⊢ q as an example of a pure and simple sequent which holds on every valuation on which 1-ary # is associated with the constant-false function but not on every valuation on which it is associated with the negation function. But an inspection of possible cases reveals that there is no pure and simple sequent valid for the negation interpretation of # which is not also valid for the constant-false interpretation. (Of course there are sequents doing this—e.g., p ≻ ## p but, though pure, they are not simple. And, yes, in Set-Set, we can always find pure and simple witnesses to the non-inclusion of the one logic in the other: the determinant-induced conditions on generalized consequence relations will serve in this capacity.)

For the second observation, we note a more linguistic reformulation of Rautenberg's result, for which we first need a brief digression on defined connectives. A connective derived by composition from a set of primitive connectives yields a defined connective in one of two ways, depending on one's views of definition. On one view, isolating the derived connective is already giving a definition: one has a formula φ(p1,…, pn) in which exactly the exhibited variables occur, which since it is constructed from these variables via the primitive connectives constitutes a derived connective, applying to formulas ψ1,…, ψn to yield the formula φ(ψ1,…,ψn) which results from substituting ψi uniformly for pi in φ(p1,…, pn). We can introduce a shorthand to such substitution-instances, denoting φ(ψ1,…,ψn) by “#(ψ1,…,ψn)”, for instance—as in calling the formula ¬(ψ1 ∧ ¬ ψ2) by the name “ψ1 → ψ2”. (Of course this would only be a good idea if there is nothing better to mean, or which is already meant, by →—as there would be in intuitionistic logic, for instance.) That is the first view of definition.[12] On the second view, rather than just being a metalinguistic abbreviation, the defined connective is an addition to the object language: we add (to continue with the example just given) a new primitive connective →, along with a stipulation that compounds of the form ψ1 → ψ2 are to be synonymous with those of the corresponding form ¬(ψ1 ∧ ¬ ψ2). We need not choose between these views here, but some formulations are sensitive to which view is taken. In particular, if we have classical logic with primitives ¬ and ∧, we may still wish to consider its implicational fragment—in Set-Fmla, say, where this would be the restriction of ⊢CL to formulas constructed using only the connective →. On the first view of definition, we cannot literally do that, since to use → is ipso facto to use ¬ and ∧, so what is meant is rather than the only occurrences of ¬ and ∧ are such as occur in subformulas of the form ψ1 → ψ2 in virtue of these being the formulas ¬(ψ1 ∧ ¬ψ2). On the second view of definition, we have expanded the language-as-algebra by adding a new fundamental operation → and can now consider the subalgebra generated by the propositional variables of the reduct of this algebra obtained by discarding the other fundamental operations.

Now let φ1 and φ2 any two classically non-equivalent formulas in the same variables, p1,…, pn for definiteness, and consider the consequence relations ⊢1 and ⊢2, where ⊢1 is the restriction of ⊢CL to formulas constructed using the n-ary connective # defined thus:

#(ψ1,…,ψn) = φ1(ψ1,…,ψn),

and ⊢2 is the analogous restriction of ⊢CL this time to the #-fragment with # defined by:

#(ψ1,…,ψn) = φ2(ψ1,…,ψn).

Since each of φ1 and φ2 fixes an n-ary truth-function of the variables involved, and these truth-functions are distinct (since φ1 and φ2 were to be non-equivalent) the above Vf / Vg application of Rautenberg's result tells us that neither of ⊢1, ⊢2, is included in the other. Concentrating on the connectives involved, we can put this by saying that in classical logic any two non-equivalent connectives are incomparable with respect to the subconnective relation (understood as relating the consequence relations on languages in which no further connectives appear). We close by observing that the analogous claim would be false for intuitionistic logic. A counterexample is provided by the connectives defined by φ #1 ψ = ¬φ∨ ¬ψ and φ #2 ψ = ¬(φ ∧ ψ). These are intuitionistically non-equivalent, in the sense of not always yielding ⊢I L-equivalent compounds from the same components, while—by an argument not given here—for any intuitionistically provable sequent σ(#1) involving formulas constructed from the variables by means of #1, the corresponding sequent σ(#2) is also intuitionistically provable (though not conversely). So, by contrast with what can happen in the classical setting, we have non-equivalent connectives one of which is a proper subconnective of the other—understanding this last phrase subject to the same parenthetical qualification as above.

3. Rules and Connectives

For this section the focus will be on rules governing the various connectives, beginning with a deferred topic from Section 2: the transfer of Carnap-inspired questions of the range of valuations on which the sequents provable in this or that logic hold to question about the range of valuations on which the sequent-to-sequent rules preserve the property of holding. We will also revisit the sequent-calculus operational rules from early in Section 2 and look at some of their properties, as well as at some interesting variations on the structural rules which work alongside them. One topic—or pair of topics—raised by such investigations is the issue of the existence and uniqueness of connectives exhibiting prescribed logical behaviour (such as might be enshrined in various rules), an issue bearing on all approaches to logic and not just the sequent calculus approach. Finally we look at a pair of concepts applying to connectives as they behave in particular logics: the concept of a universally representative connective and the concept of a ‘special’ connective.

Beginning, then, with the preservation behaviour of rules (as in Garson (1990) and (2001)) it is necessary first to distinguish a (sequent-to-sequent) rule's having a local preservation characteristic with respect to a class V of valuations—that for each v ∈ V, the rule preserves the property of holding on v—from its having a global preservation characteristic with respect to V: if the premiss-sequents hold on every v ∈ V, then the conclusion-sequent holds on every v ∈ V. For brevity, a sequent will be called V-valid when it holds on each v ∈ V. Then we distinguish the local range of a rule ρ, denoted Loc(ρ) from its global range, Glo(ρ), taking the definitions as relative to a background language the class of all valuations for which we denote by U:

Loc(ρ) = {v ∈ U : ρ preserves the property of holding on v}
Glo(ρ) = {V ⊆ U : ρ preserves V-validity}.

It is also natural to define the local and global range of a collection R of rules, by setting Loc(R) = ∩ρ ∈ RLoc(ρ) and

Glo(R) = {V ⊆ U : each ρ ∈ R preserves V-validity}.

Note that while the local range of a rule or set of rules is a set of valuations, the global range is a set of sets of valuations. But in some cases there is an especially simple relationship between the two, namely that Glo(R) = ℘(Loc(R)). This happens whenever R comprises only zero-premiss rules, and, more interestingly, when the rules in R are interderivable with a set of such rules, given the structural rules (Id), (Weakening), and (Cut),[13] as in the case of the natural deduction rules for conjunction R = {(∧I), (∧E)} or the corresponding sequent calculus rules {∧ Right, ∧ Left} where Loc(R) comprises precisely the ∧-boolean valuations. Evidently, the strong classicality phenomenon of Section 2 is making its presence felt here, and we should contrast the situation with disjunction (in Set-Fmla). For R = {(∨I), (∨E)}, Loc(R) is the class of ∨-boolean valuations, but the same is the case if (∨E)—the rule of current interest since it has no zero-premiss equivalent—is replaced by another which is far from interderivable with it (even given the structural rules and (∨I)):

A ≻ B
A ∨ B ≻ B

Thus the local range is not very informative as to the precise significance of such a rule as (∨E) and it is natural if one thinks of the rules as giving the meanings of the connectives they govern (a perspective mentioned in Section 1) and wants to distill this information into a semantics in terms of valuations, to consider the global range. To do so we make use of the partial order ≤ on the underlying set U of valuations (for the language under consideration) defined by: u ≤ v if and only for all formulas φ, if u(φ) = T then v(φ) = T.[14] As Garson (2001) observes, the global range of the introduction and elimination rules for ∨ (and again we could equally well cite the sequent calculus rules in this connection) is the set of all V ⊆ U such that for all u ∈ V and all formulas φ and ψ, the following condition is satisfied:[15]

[∨]Garson      u(φ ∨ ψ) = T iff for all formulas χ such that u(χ) = F, there exists v ∈ V with u ≤ v, v(χ) = F and either v(φ) = T or v(ψ) = T.

While we cannot go into the details of Garson's program here, its aim should be noted: to arrive at the ‘natural semantics’ implicit in the rules governing a connective # (here assumed n-ary) in the sense of a characterization of their global range as comprising those V of valuations satisfying a condition of the form: ∀u ∈ V, u(#(φ1,…,φn)) = T if and only if …, where the dots are replaced by something which would render this biconditional suitable as a clause in the inductive definition of truth on a valuation u ∈ V. Garson worries about the use of ≤ on this score in what we are calling [∨]Garson (and has various suggestions to offer), as well as about the explicit quantification over χ which introduces an potential element of circularity or impredicativity (in particular because χ need not have a lower complexity—be constructed with the aid of fewer primitive connectives, that is—than φ ∨ ψ itself); related concerns are aired in Woods (2013). One way of getting rid of the latter feature is to massage [∨]Garson into the following equivalent form, which makes extensive use of conjunctive combinations of valuations, and uses the notation |χ| which, for a formula χ, denotes the set of v∈ V such that v(χ) = T:

u(φ ∨ ψ) = T iff ∃ U0, U1 ⊆ V: U0 ⊆ |φ|, U1 ⊆ |ψ|, and u = ∏ U0 ⋅ ∏ U1.

In place of this last “∏ U0 ⋅ ∏ U1”, we could equally well have written “∏ (U0 ∪ U1)”, of course. The form as written is more suggestive of the many variations on the semantic treatment of disjunction in the literature—the Beth semantics for intuitionistic logic, for instance, and the treatment of disjunction for relevant (or ‘relevance’) and other substructural logics to be found in Ono and Komori (1985), Orłowska (1985, 455), Bell (1986), and Humberstone (1988), to cite only some papers from the 1980s. (See subsections 6.43–6.46 of Humberstone 2011 for a survey of some of these treatments.) We will not discuss other connectives from this perspective here, or comment further on Garson's program. See Garson (2001) for a discussion of the global ranges of the usual sets of introduction and elimination rules for →, ¬ and ↔.[16] Garson's approach to these matters has, it should be noted, undergone further evolution since the publications cited in this discussion: see Garson (2013).

The idea which, has just re-surfaced in our discussion, apropos of Garson, that the natural deduction introduction and elimination rules together, or perhaps just the introduction rules alone (Gentzen's preferred position),[17] somehow fix the meanings of the connectives they govern, often goes hand in hand with considerations of the existence and the uniqueness of a connective answering to the said rules, considerations first raised by H. Hiż, according to Belnap (1962). Belnap was replying to Prior (1960) in which the idea that any old set of rules could be stipulated to fix the meaning of a proposed connective, was contested with the aid of the subsequently much-discussed example Tonk, a supposed binary connective for which an introduction rule allowed the passage from (arbitrary) φ to φ Tonk ψ, as with ∨-introduction from the first disjunct, and an elimination rule allowed the passage from φ Tonk ψ to ψ, as with ∧-elimination to the second conjunct. (This was the point anticipated in §2 when the Tonk problem was mentioned apropos of the dual to hybridizing conjunction and disjunction.) Since this allowed, by successively applying (Tonk-I) and then (Tonk-E), any ψ to be derived from any φ, Prior took this to show that no coherent meaning had been conferred on Tonk by the proposed rules, and to refute the general thesis that the meaning of a connective can be fixed by means of rules governing it. (Prior saw Popper and Kneale as the targets of his argument, which does not touch Gentzen's view that the meaning is fixed by the totality of introduction rules for a connective, coupled with the fact that these are the totality of such rules. Since there is only the one way of introducing Tonk, namely that provided by (Tonk-I), where the premiss is φ the meaning of φ Tonk ψ is simply that of φ and the appropriate elimination rule is not that given by Prior but rather one licensing an elimination to the first “tonkjunct”.) Belnap responded that what was wrong with Prior's Tonk rules was that a proof system antecedently endorsed for the connectives in use would be non-conservatively extended by the enrichment of the language with Tonk in tandem with supplementing the proof system with the (Tonk-I) and then (Tonk-E), since they allow the derivation of the sequent φ ≻ ψ even for Tonk-free φ, ψ.[18] Later in this section, we return to Tonk and examine its behaviour in a sequent calculus setting.

Of course, one expects the addition of new rules to make for the provability of new sequents, but the extension should be conservative in the sense that no new sequents exclusively involving the old vocabulary become provable. Belnap's discussion suggests that the existence of a connective obeying certain rules should be conceded by someone endorsing a particular proof system if and only if the addition of that connective to the language and those rules to the proof system yields a conservative extension. (There are other things one might mean by the question of whether from the perspective of a given logic, a connective with such-and-such logical powers exists—most evidently, whether or not such a connective is already definable in the logic. Showing that rules ascribing the powers in question would extend the logic non-conservatively would be one dramatic way of showing no such connective to be definable, but since it could fail to be definable while still being conservatively addable, the questions need to be kept distinct.)

One snag for such a suggestion is that examples can be found (see §6 of Humberstone (2001) or p. 568f. of Humberstone (2011a)) where each of two connectives with associated sets of rules can be such as to yield a conservative extension of a proof system, apparently requiring the answer “yes, there does exist such a connective” in each case, while extending the proof system with both at once is non-conservative—undermining this double endorsement. We may conclude that while yielding a non-conservative extension of a favoured proof system is sufficient to denying the existence or intelligibility of a connective with such-and-such logical properties, there may be other grounds for returning such a verdict. Boolean negation comes under just such a critique in Chapter 5 of Priest (2006), where such problems for Belnap's account are raised and references to the technical literature establishing the conservativity of extending certain logics in the relevance tradition with suitable principles governing this connection can also be found. (For an earlier presentation of this point, see also Belnap and Dunn (1981), p. 344, and for a related discussion, Restall (1993), esp. §5.) It should be noted also that the conservativity test raises issues of its own, independently of the question of whether passing it is necessary and sufficient (and what we have been querying is the sufficiency half of this package) for acknowledging the existence of a connective. For example, there are sentential connectives which conservatively extend intuitionistic propositional logic in any of its conventional presentations as a proof system, but non-conservatively extend intuitionistic predicate logic. The best known is dual intuitionistic implication (see López-Escobar (1985)).[19] Returning to the conservative extension criterion of existence, let us note that a related connective, dual intuitionistic negation, can be added conservatively to intuitionistic predicate (and a fortiori propositional logic) but already at the propositional level produces violations of the disjunction property—that ≻ φ ∨ ψ should only be provable if at least one of ≻ φ, ≻ ψ, is provable—which on some accounts (e.g., Gabbay (1977) and (1981)) renders it illegitimate from an intuitionistic perspective. Finally, it should be observed that an adherent of intuitionistic logic might be expected to take a dim view of a proposed new connective with rules conservatively extending that logic but not conserving synonymies, in the sense that formulas in the original language which are synonymous according to ⊢I L are no longer so according to the consequence relation associated with the extended proof system. This happens in at least the most straightforward extension of intuitionistic logic by what is called strong negation.[20]

The issue of uniqueness, as opposed to existence, of connectives (in the logically loaded sense of the term, naturally) is best approached by considering when a collection of rules governing a connective uniquely characterize that connective in the sense that if accompanied by corresponding rules governing a ‘duplicate’ version of that connective (of the same arity) result in the synonymy of compounds formed from the appropriately many components and the original connective with compounds formed from the duplicate connective from the same components. In a congruential setting the reference to synonymy can be replaced by one of equivalence, in the sense of ⊣⊢-equivalence in the consequence relation or Set-Fmla framework, with suitable variations for other frameworks. Without the assumption of congruentiality one should perhaps distinguish unique characterization to within synonymy from unique characterization to within equivalence. And because the rules in question may not be pure, but involve other connectives, it may be necessary to speak of # being uniquely characterized (by the given rules) in terms of the other connectives involved, so that when the reduplicated system is considered, # is replaced by its duplicate, #′, say, while the other connectives remain as they are. We will not be considering these complications here. It is easy to see that the natural deduction rules for the various connectives given in Section 2 as well as the sequent calculus rules all uniquely characterize the connectives they govern. (Note that, since this includes the introduction and elimination rules for →, which are shared by any natural deduction system for intuitionistic logic, the rules may uniquely characterize a connective which is not fully determined—not amenable to a truth-functional interpretation. The same applies in respect of negation, though we did not cover this in our discussion of natural deduction.) This feature is sometimes regarded as necessary for the connectives concerned to be regarded as logical constants, although, as explained in Section 1, we are not pursuing that issue here.

A related issue involving both uniqueness and existence does deserve attention, however, arising over competition between logics, differing on the rules governing a connective where the first logic has rules which suffice to characterize uniquely a connective and the second has all these and more governing that connective. The standard example of this is provided by intuitionistic logic and classical logic in respect of negation. The fact that the classical rules go beyond the intuitionistic rules and yet the latter already suffice for unique characterization means that there is no ‘live and let live’ option available for the intuitionist, of recognising that the intelligibility of two distinct negation connectives, classical and intuitionistic, which can cohabit in the same proof system each with their respect rules. This should be possible according to those who think that any difference in the logical principles governing a connective reflect a difference as to what is meant by the connective (W. V. Quine's view—see Section 5 below), since once a difference in meaning is acknowledged, the previously ambiguous connective, “¬”, in the present instance, should be replaceable by connectives registering the disambiguation—¬i and ¬c, say—and the intuitionistic and classical logician should be able to use whichever they take a special interest in, with no further fear of talking at cross-purposes in each other's company. But of course this is not a possibility, since the rules governing ¬i characterize it uniquely and those governing ¬c duplicate them—think of ¬c as ¬i′, in terms of the above discussion—and do more (securing the provability of ¬c¬cp ≻ p, for example). The result is that the two connectives form equivalent compounds in the reduplicated system and all of the intuitionistically unwanted properties of ¬c spill over to infect ¬i: we can now prove ¬i ¬ip ≻ p, and so on. The conciliatory offer of a purportedly disambiguating notation along these lines is one no advocate of intuitionistic logic can afford to accept. (By imposing restrictions on some of the intuitionistic rules, one can produce candidates for the title of ‘combined classical-and-intuitionistic proof system’—as, for example, in Fariñas del Cerro and Herzig (2001)—but, especially on views according to which the rules of one's logic articulate the meanings of the connectives they govern, resistance to any such restrictions is entirely understandable. Imagine an encounter with aliens in which they told us that to explain what they meant by some items of their vocabulary we had to be prepared to restrict the principle that ψ followed from φ and ψ for certain choices of ψ involving translations of that vocabulary into English.)

The above line of thought points in some interesting further directions. For example, the intuitionistic natural deduction rules governing ∧ (in Set-Fmla), which are the same as the classical ones, are themselves stronger than the following rules:[21]

χ ≻ φ   χ ≻ ψ
χ ≻ φ ∧ ψ
χ ≻ φ ∧ ψ
χ ≻ φ
χ ≻ φ ∧ ψ
χ ≻ ψ

We can take the intuitionistic (and classical) rules to differ from these in replacing the formula variable χ with a set-of-formulas variable Γ. The latter set is stronger in the sense that there are sequents provable with its rules (e.g., p, q ≻ p ∧ q) which are not provable on the basis of the displayed rules (together with the standard structural rules, if desired). But clearly the displayed rules uniquely characterize ∧, since, once we reduplicate them for ∧′, we can take χ in the second and third (collectively, (∧E)-style) rules to be φ ∧ ψ, to derive both φ ∧ ψ ≻ φ and φ ∧ ψ ≻ ψ, from which by the reduplicated version of the first (“(∧′I)”) rule we derive φ ∧ ψ ≻ φ ∧′ ψ—with a similar derivation for the converse sequent.

This example may seem far-fetched from the point of view of motivation, but the dialectical upshot is clear—if the ¬ rules are objectionable in being stronger than needed for unique characterization, the same holds for the intuitionistic ∧ rules; in any case there are in fact variations on this theme is that have been seriously proposed as weakenings of classical (or intuitionistic) logic in the construction of quantum (or ortho-) logic, in which the rule (∨E) is subjected to restrictions blocking arbitrary sets of side-formulas—the Δ and θ of our formulation of this rule in Section 2—exactly as with the ∧ rules inset above (which would be fully general in the respect at issue if our chosen framework were what would naturally be called Fmla-Fmla, a framework occasionally used for logical investigations).[22] One could explore the idea of a requirement that all rules should be maximally general in respect of side formulas, to resist such pressures to weaken the intuitionistic rules, though what this amounts to depends on the logical framework, and it may be hard to hold the line without succumbing to a similar pull in the direction of generality which would take us over from Set-Fmla to Set-Set.

The sensitivity to logical framework of issues of unique characterization is well illustrated with the case of modal logic. It is possible to fabricate special purpose logical frameworks which allow for the formulation of rules uniquely characterizing ☐ in all normal modal logics (Blamey and Humberstone 1991), but without such exotic devices, unique characterization is limited to the case in which ☐ is fully determined—amongst the normal modal logics, then, just to that for which ⊢ ☐ φ for all φ, and that in which φ ⊣⊢ ☐ φ for all φ. (Note 31 is relevant here. The “⊢” just used stands for the local consequence relation concerned so we could equally well have written, “⊢ φ ↔ ☐ φ”. Even more exotic logical frameworks for modal logic – taking us even further away from the idea of an argument with premisses and conclusion(s), that is – have been proposed that that of Blamey and Humberstone 1991. Many can be seen in Poggiolesi and Restall 2012 and in the literature cited in their bibliography.)

This same framework-sensitivity issue can be illustrated by considering substructural logics in multiset-based frameworks. Classical Linear Logic has two versions of the propositional constants (or 0-ary connectives) ⊥ and ⊤, called (in the relevance tradition—see Avron (1988)—rather than in the notation of the seminal paper Girard (1987)) F and f in the former case and T and t in the latter, with the following Mset-Mset rules, the Greek letters now standing for finite multisets of formulas (and commas for multiset union):

(F Left) Γ, F ≻ Δ           (T Right) Γ ≻ T, Δ
(t Left)
Γ ≻ Δ
Γ, t ≻ Δ
         (t Right) ≻ t
(f Left) f ≻          (f Right)
Γ ≻ Δ
Γ ≻ f, Δ

If we were doing classical logic with multisets, we would need the structural rules (Id), (Weakening) and (Cut) from Section 2, set-variables now reinterpreted as multiset variables, and the further rule of Contraction to allow double occurrences of formulas on the left or right of the ≻ to be replaced by single occurrences. For linear logic we retain only (Id) and (Cut), disallowing weakenings and contractions, which has the effect that there are now also two versions of conjunction and of disjunction, multiplicative and additive—into which distinction we cannot go further here, except to say that for binary connectives it lines up with the intensional/extensional distinction in the relevance tradition.[23] A sequent calculus presentation of the favoured logic from this tradition, R, can be obtained from that for Classical Linear Logic (without two of its characteristic 1-ary connectives, called exponentials, which are there to mark formulas for which weakening and contraction are permitted) by allowing contraction (while still banning weakening).[24] We return to R in Example 6 of Section 4; it is for the sake of that return that the rules governing t and T have been given here alongside those for f and F, the latter pair being of current interest. Notice that even though there is only one rule for F, namely a left insertion rule (with no premiss sequents), this rule suffices to characterize F uniquely, since in the combined language with F′ governed by a like rule we can prove—just by appealing to the appropriate instance of the rule F ≻ F′ and F′ ≻ F. The weaker system of Intuitionistic Linear Logic is cast in the framework Mset-Fmla0 disallowing the appearance of more than one formula on the right, and this application of the left rule for F is available there, as also in Mset-Fmla, requiring exactly one formula on the right (since we have exactly one formula—F or F′—there in the present case). When we turn to f, again we find that the rules uniquely characterize this connective, since (f Left) provides the premiss for an application of (f′ Right) with Γ consisting of (one occurrence of) f and Δ empty, yielding f ≻ f′, with the converse proved similarly. (Note that while F ≻ f is a special case of the (left) rule for F, there is no proof of the converse sequent. One cannot begin with f ≻ and then weaken in an F on the right, since we do not have Weakening.[25]) Again, these derivations go through in Mset-Fmla0, but this time we note that they do not go through in Mset-Fmla, since the left insertion rule has no applications in that framework. When attention is restricted to Mset-Fmla, there is no set of pure rules available which uniquely characterize f. The Mset-Mset (or Mset-Fmla0) sequent calculus rules for ¬, which can be taken to be those given in Section 2 with the set-variables taken as multiset-variables (suitably restricted for Mset-Fmla0), uniquely characterize ¬, but have no direct application in Mset-Fmla or any other framework with a fixed multiset cardinality on the right (or the left, for that matter). We can say in this framework that the rules governing ¬ uniquely characterize this connective in terms of → and f—on the basis of which it would indeed be explicitly definable (¬ φ as φ → f), but since here f is not uniquely characterized (even though → is), this still leaves ¬ without its (perhaps) expected uniqueness, as is even more evident in Fmla. These considerations continue to apply in the presence of contraction (and ∧/∨) distribution, accounting for the complaint sometimes made that relevant logic does not operate with a uniquely characterized negation. The point here has not been either to press or to reply to such complaints, but to note their framework sensitivity: they do not arise for Mset-Mset or Mset-Fmla0.

The existence and uniqueness questions for connectives turn out in the case of sequent calculus rules to be intimately connected with the structural rules (Id) and (Cut). Let us call the left and right insertion rules governing an n-ary connective #—or derivatively, the connective thereby governed—Id-inductive if the provability of #(φ1,…,φn) ≻ #(φ1,…,φn) follows from the provability of each φi ≻ φi (i = 1,…,n) by means of those rules (without assistance from other structural rules). Thus means that no provable sequents are lost if the rule (Id) itself is restricted to having applications φ ≻ φ for φ a propositional variable. And let us say that the rules in question are Cut-inductive if an application of the rule (Cut) with the formula #(φ1,…,φn) as cut-formula (i.e., as the φ of our representation of the rule (Cut) in Section 2 or the analogous rule in Set-Set or the multiset based frameworks) can be dispensed with if the premiss sequents for the application of the rule have been derived by (# Left) and (# Right) and (Cut) is allowed with the components φ1,…,φn as cut-formulas (but again, not allowing the use of other structural rules).

All the connectives of the standard sequent calculi, including the cases of classical and intuitionistic linear logic, are inserted by rules which are both Id-inductive and Cut-inductive, as we illustrate here with the rules for →. For definiteness, think of these as the Left and Right rules of classical linear logic. To show Id-inductivity, we must show that φ → ψ ≻ φ → ψ is provable using the → rules, given (‘the inductive hypothesis’) that φ ≻ φ and ψ ≻ ψ are. (We write φ and ψ rather than φ1 and φ2.) From the last two sequents, (→ Left) delivers: φ → ψ, φ ≻ ψ. From this an application of (→ Right) gives the desired conclusion: φ → ψ ≻ φ → ψ.

For Cut-inductivity suppose (1) Γ, Γ′, φ → ψ ≻ Δ, Δ′ has arisen by (→ Left) from (1a) Γ ≻ φ, Δ and (2a) Γ′, ψ ≻ Δ′, while (2) Γ′′ ≻ φ → ψ, Δ′′ has arisen by (→ Right) from (2a) Γ′′, φ ≻ ψ, Δ′′. We need to show that a cut on (1) and (2) with cut-formula φ → ψ can be avoided on the hypothesis that we can help ourselves to cuts with cut-formulas φ, ψ. From (1a) and (2a), cutting on φ, we get (3) Γ, Γ′′ ≻ ψ, Δ′′. Then cutting on ψ, (2b) and (3) deliver the desired conclusion: Γ, Γ′, Γ′′ ≻ Δ, Δ′, Δ′′, without the need to use φ → ψ as a cut-formula with (1) and (2) as premisses.

Cut-inductivity is one aspect of a procedure which has traditionally been a professional obsession of proof-theorists: the provision of ‘Cut Elimination’ theorems to the effect that this or that sequent calculus with the rule (Cut) can have this rule removed without the loss of any provable sequents. Obviously more is needed to show this than the Cut-inductivity of the (pairs of) rules, since there are also, inter alia, potential interactions with the other structural (and operational) rules to be taken care of. Such results are of interest because much follows from the subformula property—any sequent provable has a proof in which the only formulas to appear are subformulas of those in the sequent concerned—which itself follows from the result since all the remaining rules insert material rather than remove it in the course of the proof.[26] But from the perspective of the philosophy of logic, Cut-inductivity and its somewhat less well-publicized companion, Id-inductivity, should be considered on a par, as the following somewhat impressionistic semantical remark (Girard, Taylor and Lafont (1989), p. 31) of Girard suggests, apropos of (Cut), in which C represents the cut formula (and (Id) with C on the left and right of the “≻”):

The identity axiom says that C (on the left) is stronger than C (on the right); this rule [ = (Cut)] states the converse truth, i.e. C (on the right) is stronger than C (on the left).

The point of isolating Id- and Cut-inductivity here, however, has less to do with matters of truth (on which, and for further references to Girard on which, see further Hösli and Jäger (1994)) than with uniqueness and existence—not that the semantical issues are unconnected with this, of course. The former link is perhaps already clear. At the last step of establishing Id-inductivity for →, above, we passed from φ → ψ, φ ≻ ψ, obtained by (→ Left), to φ → ψ ≻ φ → ψ, by (→ Left): but this is just what the uniqueness proof in the reduplicated sequent calculus would do, except that the final step would be an application of (→′ Right) and would establish φ → ψ ≻ φ →′ ψ, with the converse proved by interchanging the rules used for → and →′.

To see the connection between existence—or more specifically, the conservative extension side of the existence question—convert the natural deduction rules for Tonk given earlier into sequent calculus rules (here for Set-Fmla):

(Tonk Left)
Γ,ψ ≻ χ
Γ, φ Tonk ψ ≻ χ
(Tonk Right)
Γ ≻ φ
Γ ≻ φ Tonk ψ

By applying the right insertion rule with premiss sequent (courtesy of (Id)) φ ≻ φ and the left rule with premiss ψ ≻ ψ we arrive at the point at which our natural deduction derivation started to go bad: we have:

φ ≻ φ Tonk ψ and φ Tonk ψ ≻ ψ

and an appeal to (Cut) here, with φ Tonk ψ as cut-formula, amounts to bringing home the bad news.[27] But of course this example simply makes vivid the fact that the Tonk rules in play are not Cut-inductive and there is no Cut-free proof of the desired sequent (at least in general: take φ = p, ψ = q). This is hardly surprising since the subformula property which Cut Elimination secures itself guarantees that the rules for one connective conservatively extend the subsystem comprising the rules for the remaining connectives. In the present case, the point of the example was that there was no proof of, for example, p ≻ q which did not detour—in violation of the subformula property—via formulas involving Tonk.

We can look at what is roughly speaking a mirror-image of the Tonk example to reinforce the contrast between Cut-inductivity and Id-inductivity and their respective links with existence and uniqueness, and then sort out the “roughly speaking” part of this description, which will show them as providing, rather, special—one might say canonical—cases of the satisfaction of the existence ( = conservative extension) and uniqueness conditions. We conduct the discussion in Set-Set rather than Set-Fmla to avoid a mass of complications. The above Tonk rules combine a left insertion rule familiar from the sequent calculus treatment of ∧ and a right insertion rule familiar from that of ∨; their reformulation for the change of framework just announced requires an idle Δ parameter on the right of the sequents in the premisses and conclusions of the rules as schematically presented above (replacing the χ in the one case, accompanying the displayed succedent formulas in the other). For our mirror image example,[28] consider a binary connective Knot with rules combining instead the left insertion rule for ∨ with the right insertion rule for ∧:

(Knot Left)
Γ,φ ≻ Δ   Γ,ψ ≻ Δ
Γ, φ Knot ψ ≻ Δ
(Knot Right)
Γ ≻ φ, Δ   Γ ≻ ψ, Δ
Γ ≻ φ Knot ψ, Δ

These rules are Cut-inductive, as the interested reader may confirm, but not Id-inductive, since they do not uniquely characterize Knot. To see this, note that both are derivable rules for ∧ and also for ∨, and of course we cannot prove φ ∨ ψ ≻ φ ∧ ψ in general. By contrast, neither ∧ nor ∨ satisfies both of the left and right rules for Tonk. The upshot of the Knot rules is best visualised in terms of the zero-premiss rules (sequent-schemata) with which they are interderivable given the structural rules: φ, ψ ≻ φ Knot ψ (the right rule) and φ Knot ψ ≻ φ, ψ (the left rule). An incidental point: since these are the sequent formulations of conditions induced by the determinants ⟨T, T, T⟩ and ⟨F, F, F⟩ one might think of them together as expressing idempotence and therefore as being interchangeable with the simpler pair φ ≻ φ Knot φ and φ Knot φ ≻ φ. But while the latter two can be derived from the earlier pair (just take ψ as φ), the converse derivation is not possible without further principles—conspicuously, a sequent version of the extensionality conditions on generalized consequence relations mentioned in Section 2. We could call binary # for which φ, ψ ⊩φ # ψ and conversely, strongly idempotent according to the generalized consequence relation ⊩. Then ∧ and ∨ are not the only boolean candidates for a connective behaving as the Knot rules dictate—strongly idempotent according to the generalized consequence relation ⊩CL determined by the class of boolean valuations: we also have the binary projection to the first coordinate (φ # ψ equivalent to φ), to the second coordinate (φ # ψ equivalent to ψ), and venturing further afield, the Set-Fmla hybrids of any two of these connectives. Of these perhaps the most interesting is the hybrid of the two projection connectives, since this—let us write is as “•”—can be used to define all other hybrids explicitly from the connectives to be hybridized; for example if we want the common properties (as explained in Section 2) of → and ∨, we have them in the following compound of φ and ψ: (φ → ψ) • (φ ∨ ψ).[29]

If the treatment of Knot were genuinely the mirror image of that of Tonk, we would be able to say that just as the Knot rules are Cut-inductive but not Id-inductive, so the Tonk rules are Id-inductive but not Cut-inductive. (The twofold demand of Cut- and Id-inductivity is a promising candidate for the notion of harmony as it applies to the relation between right and left insertion rules in a sequent calculus.[30]) And while the failure of Cut-inductivity was indeed noted, nothing was said on the subject of Id-inductivity for these rules. Spoiling the intended duality, the situation is that the Tonk rules fail on this score too—though this can be remedied by a simple variation. First, we should note that Prior's point could equally well have been made by combining the ∨ introduction rule from the second (rather than the to first) disjunct with the ∧ elimination rule to the first (rather than to the second) conjunct. Call the connective with these rules Tonk*

Tonk* Left
Γ,ψ ≻ Δ
Γ, φ Tonk* ψ ≻ Δ
       Tonk* Right
Γ ≻ ψ, Δ
Γ ≻ φ Tonk* ψ, Δ

This suffers from the same defects in respect of the analogy with Knot, so, finally, let Tonk+ be governed by the rules for Tonk and also the rules for Tonk*. It is Tonk+ that has Knot as its mirror image, since just as we Knot has the full force of the (∧ Right) and (∨ Left) rules, Tonk+ enjoys the full force of the (∧ Left) and (∨ Right) rules. (So here we arrive at the reason that Knot was originally described as only roughly speaking a mirror image of Tonk.) And this time the rules are indeed Id-inductive without being Cut-inductive. Indeed, Id-inductivity is secured by two independent routes: by the interaction of the Tonk Left rule for Tonk+ with the Tonk* Right rule to Tonk+, and then again by the interaction of Tonk+‘s Tonk* Left rule with its Tonk Right rule. (To give the former in more detail, by way of example, the Tonk Left rule for Tonk+ gives φ Tonk+ ψ ≻ψ from (Id)-for-ψ, from which applying the Tonk* Right rule for Tonk+ we obtain φ Tonk+ ψ ≻ φ Tonk+ ψ.)

Let us sum up the lessons for the relations between existence and Cut-inductivity and between uniqueness and Id-inductivity that can be extracted from the foregoing discussion. Sequent calculus rules which are Id-inductive uniquely characterize the connective they govern, but not necessarily conversely: the Tonk rules are not Id-inductive, but they do uniquely characterize Tonk, since they are already so strong that any sequent with at least one formula on the left and at least one on the right can be proved with their aid, and hence, in the reduplicated system with Tonk′, we can certainly prove φ Tonk ψ ≻ φ Tonk′ ψ and the converse sequent—without even using the Tonk′ rules! (This is the kind of thing we have in mind in calling this a non-canonical form of uniqueness.) On the ‘existence’ side: it is not clear to the author whether any Cut-inductive rules governing a connective guarantee that they are conservative over the (system consisting of the) rules governing other connective—since Cut Elimination may fail for other reasons; nor do the examples just considered settle the converse, as we see from the following tabular summary of our findings, in which (a “Yes” by) “unique” means the rules uniquely characterize the connective, and “conservative” means that we have a conservative extension of any system of sequent-calculus rules not involving the given connective; Tonk* is not listed separately since it patterns the same way as Tonk:

Id-inductive Unique Cut-inductive Conservative
Tonk No Yes No No
Tonk+ Yes Yes No No
Knot No No Yes Yes

That is enough on the subject of Tonk and variations. We will make one point about unique characterization and then give some examples of non-conservative extension which will involve introducing the important concepts of special and universally representative connectives. Some further ‘existence’ examples are deferred to the following section.

The above discussion has included such phrases as “the hybrid of ∧ and ∨”; the totality of principles governing such a connective being those common to ∧ and ∨, we obviously do not have a connective uniquely characterized by those principles—in which case is it legitimate to speak of the hybrid…? I take this way of speaking to be as harmless as speaking of “the ☐ operator of S5”, where again the logical principles involved are insufficient to characterize the connective uniquely—in terms of the boolean connective or otherwise—at least if we are Fmla, Set-Fmla or Set-Set, and in the latter cases, working with the so-called local (generalized) consequence relation.[31] (See Section 5 for the distinction between the local and the global consequence relations determined by a class of models.) One could say that in the monomodal, unreduplicated case, we have a single connective playing a certain role and we can refer to it in that context as the connective playing the role in question, while conceding, as we learn from the reduplicated case, that this is a role that can be played simultaneously (i.e. in a single logic) by several non-equivalent connectives. This is the kind of situation Łukasiewicz had in mind when, in his (1953), he likened certain pairs of connectives to “twins who cannot be distinguished when met separately, but are instantly recognised as two when seen together”.

We saw earlier that combining the intuitionistic and classical rules in a single proof system did not work well, and another suggestion that comes to mind is that we could perhaps extend intuitionistic logic with a new connective, 1-ary #, say, which does what according to the intuitionist, negation (¬) itself cannot do: serve as a left inverse for ¬ in the sense of rendering equivalent #¬φ and φ for all φ.[32] This again represents an offer the intuitionist cannot afford to accept, assuming that any (the rules for any) proposed new connectives should conserve synonymy, as suggested above. (The even stronger demand that the consequence relation associated with the extended proof systems should be congruential does not seem unreasonable.) The reason is that ¬p and ¬¬¬p are intuitionistically equivalent (and thus synonymous according to ⊢I L) so the conservation of synonymy requires that #¬p and #¬¬¬p should be equivalent—since we have this ‘Law of Triple Negation’ equivalence in intuitionistic logic—from which the left inverse condition above delivers, taking φ as ¬p in the former case and as ¬¬¬p in the latter, the equivalence of p with ¬¬p—a straightforwardly non-conservative extension, then. (A similar argument shows that adding binary # with φ # (φ ↔ ψ) equivalent to ψ—a possibility suggesting itself since, by contrast with the classical case, ↔ itself cannot serve as # here—is also non-conservative.) Nor, incidentally, could the intuitionist acknowledge the existence of a right inverse for negation, a # with arbitrary φ equivalent to ¬ # φ, as this makes every formula equivalent to a negated formula and hence to its own double negation. This argument, which is well known (see, e.g., Koslow (1992), p. 97), does not even require the ‘conservation of synonymies’ constraint.

These last non-existence proofs force our attention on the fact that negated formulas are ‘special’ in intuitionistic logic in that each such formula is equivalent to its own double negation while this is not so for arbitrary formulas. Let us back up and give a clear explanation of the notion of specialness as well as a contrasting notion, in slightly more general terms; for definiteness only, we tailor the account to Set-Fmla. We also begin with the contrasting notion. Say that an n-ary relation R amongst the formulas of a language is universally representative according to a consequence relation on that language if for any formulas φ1,…,φn of the language, there are formulas ψ1,…,ψn, respectively synonymous with φ1,…,φn according to ⊢, with R(ψ1,…,ψn). (If n = 1, we speak instead of a universally representative class of formulas—a class of formulas such that every formula is synonymous with some formula in the class; likewise in the case of the notion special, defined below.) If ⊢ is congruential then we can replace “synonymous” in this definition with “equivalent” (i.e. such that φi ⊣⊢ ψi, for i = 1,…,n). Say that R is special according to ⊢ if there is some Set-Fmla sequent σ(p1,…, pn) constructed using not necessarily just the variables exhibited, for which for any formulas ψ1,…,ψn with R(ψ1,…,ψn), we have σ(ψ1,…,ψn) ∈ ⊢, while we do not have, for all formulas φ1,…,φn, σ(φ1,…,φn) ∈ ⊢. For substitution-invariant ⊢, this last condition can be simplified to: σ(p1,…, pn) ∉ ⊢.[33] A consequence of these definitions is that no relation is both universally representative and special according to any given ⊢. A simple example of a special relation—according to more or less any ‘naturally occurring’ consequence relation with ∨ in its language is relation R obtaining between φ and ψ just in case ψ is a disjunction of which φ is a disjunct. Here take σ(p, q) as p ≻ q which is (e.g., in intuitionistic logic, though classical logic or any of many others would do as well) unprovable—i.e., not p ⊢I L q—while φ ⊢I L ψ for all φ, ψ for which R(φ, ψ). A more interesting example is the relation of being (intuitionistically) head-linked, i.e., that relation R such that for all φ, ψ, R(φ, ψ) if and only if:

for some formulas χ, φ0, ψ0, we have φ ⊣⊢I L φ0 → χ and ψ ⊣⊢I L ψ0 → χ.

The analogous relation for classical logic would be universally representative (and thus not special), at least in any fragment which, as well as having →, has either ⊥ or ∧, since any φ and ψ are here respectively equivalent to (φ → ⊥) → ⊥ and (ψ → ⊥) → ⊥, where they are linked explicitly by having a common χ at the head of the main implication. (Alternatively with ∧, replace ⊥ here by φ ∧ ψ.) But in the intuitionistic case the relation of being head-linked is special since, for example, with Peirce's law σ(p,q) = (p → q) → p ≻ p, we have σ(p, q) intuitionistically unprovable while σ(φ,ψ) ∈ ⊢I L for any head-linked φ, ψ.

Concentrating now on 1-ary relations between—i.e., classes of—formulas, we transfer the above terminology to connectives by saying that a connective is universally representative or special according to a consequence relation if the class of formulas with the given connective as main connective is itself a universally representative class or a special class of formulas, respectively, according to the consequence relation in question. While every non-constant connective[34] is universally representative according to ⊢CL our discussion of inverses for intuitionistic ¬ shows that ¬ is special according to ⊢, since we can take σ(p) as ¬¬p ≻ p and every substitution instance of this IL-unprovable sequent in which p is replaced by a negated formula is IL-provable. Negation is therefore not universally representative in intuitionistic logic. (This means that we could usefully speak, from the perspective of ⊢I L, of negative propositions, thinking of the equivalence class, with respect to the relation of synonymy, of a formula as the proposition thereby expressed, and meaning by this the equivalence classes of negated formulas. Classically, the corresponding notion is not useful since all propositions would count as negative, just as for both ⊢CL and ⊢I L, there are no specifically conjunctive or disjunctive propositions.)

Although the properties of being special and being universally representative according to a given logic are mutually exclusive, they are not jointly exhaustive. For example, ⊥ is neither universally representative nor special in minimal logic (according to the consequence relation associated with the Johansson's Minimalkalkül, that is). Nor does the connective ☐ have either of these properties in the modal logic KD (sometimes just called D), though this example is far from selected at random: in the sublogic K ☐ is special (since ☐⊥ → φ is provable for all ☐-formulas φ, though not for arbitrary φ), and in the extension KD4 it is special again (since φ → ☐φ is provable for all ☐-formulas φ, though not for all formulas).

4. Selected Existence Questions

4.1 Conditions not Corresponding to Rules (Example 1)

For conditions other than those corresponding to (closure under certain) rules we can also ask whether a connective satisfying the condition in question can safely—i.e. conservatively—be postulated to exist. One such condition is the following, here expressed as a condition on a consequence relation ⊢ with a binary connective # in its language, all variables understood as universally quantified:

Γ ⊢ φ # ψ if and only if Γ ⊢ φ or Γ ⊢ ψ.

It is because of the “or” on the right that this condition—more precisely, its ‘only if’ half—does not correspond to a sequent-to-sequent rule. Still we can ask whether some Set-Fmla proof system including the rule (∨E) (or the sequent calculus rule (∨ Left)), e.g. for classical logic, has a conservative extension to a proof system for a language with the additional connective #, whose associated consequence relation satisfies the above condition for this #.[35] To see that the answer to this question is negative, note that the binary relation R⊢ defined in terms of the #-supporting extension ⊢: R⊢(φ,ψ) iff φ ⊢ ψ, gives rise to a binary relational connection (L, L, R⊢) which provides conjunctive (yes—conjunctive) combinations on the left, since ⊢ is ∨-classical, φ ⋅L ψ here being φ ∨ ψ, while the inset condition above (take Γ = {χ}) secures disjunctive objects on the right, with φ +R ψ being φ # ψ. (“L” and “R” subscripts from Section 1 restored here to prevent confusion, since the source and target coincide.) Thus the crossover condition from Section 1 is satisfied, which says that if φ1 ⊢ ψ1 and φ2 ⊢ ψ2 then either φ1 ⊢ ψ2 or φ2 ⊢ ψ1. Taking φ1 = ψ1 = χ and φ2 = ψ2 = χ′, we have the antecedent of this conditional (by (Id)), so we conclude that for all formulas χ, χ′, either χ ⊢ χ′ or χ′ ⊢ χ, which includes #-free formulas of the original language (e.g., χ = p, χ′ = q) for which neither is a consequence of the other by the original consequence relation, showing any proposed extension along the above lines to be non-conservative.

4.2 Pollard-Style Nonconservativity (Example 2)

This is really a whole range of examples. As we required (∨E) for Example 1, here we require (→I). Let us call a consequence relation ⊢ →-introductive if Γ, φ ⊢ ψ always implies Γ ⊢ φ → ψ.[36] Now suppose ⊢ ⊇ ⊢I L and ⊢ is →-introductive, and either (i) for some n-ary connective #, ⊢ satisfies the conditions induced (on consequence relations) by the determinant ⟨F,…, F,T⟩ (n occurrences of “F”) for #, as well as some determinant with F as its final entry, or (ii) ⊢ satisfies the conditions induced by the determinant ⟨T,…,T, F⟩ (n occurrences of “T”) as well as some determinant with T as final entry (for n-ary #). Then it follows that ⊢ ⊇ ⊢CL.

The implication from (i) to the conclusion that ⊢ ⊇ ⊢CL has been stressed in several publications by S. Pollard (Pollard (2002), Pollard and Martin (1996)); there is a similar proof for the implication from (ii). Neither proof is given here—only an illustration (of case (ii)). The truth-function known as exclusive disjunction (or xor), which differs from that associated on boolean valuations with ∨ (“inclusive disjunction”) by having ⟨T, T, F⟩ instead of the determinant ⟨T, T, T⟩, will serve as an example, since as well as the determinant just mentioned, which has T's except for the final F, we have a T-final determinant (e.g.) ⟨T, F, T⟩. The induced conditions on generalized consequence relations for these two determinants are respectively:

φ, ψ, φ # ψ ⊩    and    φ ⊩ ψ, φ # ψ.

For the following, we will take it that, as well as →, the connectives ∨, ¬, ⊤ and ⊥ are available, though in fact the result just given requires is correct for any fragment with → (with ⊢CL understood as the restriction of the classical consequence relation to the fragment in question). Then we can write the induced conditions on our consequence relation ⊢ as, respectively, rather than using a new schematic letter on the right for the first, and converting the second into conditional form:

φ, ψ, φ # ψ ⊢ ⊥    and    φ ⊢ ψ ∨ (φ # ψ).

Now making use of the hypothesis that ⊢ is →-introductive—which does not follow from the fact that ⊢I L is →-introductive and ⊢ ⊇ ⊢I L—the first condition now allows for successive rewriting, first as

φ # ψ ⊢ φ → (ψ → ⊥),

and then as

φ # ψ ⊢ φ → ¬ψ.

The fact that ⊢ is an →-introductive extension of ⊢I L suffices for ⊢ to be ∨-classical, and in particular for it to be ‘∨-eliminative’ in the sense that whenever Γ ⊢ χ1 ∨ χ2 and also Γ′, χ1 ⊢ θ and Γ′′, χ2 ⊢ θ, we have Γ, Γ′, Γ′′ ⊢ θ. Thus from the fact that φ ⊢ ψ ∨ (φ # ψ), inset on the right above, and that φ # ψ ⊢ φ → ¬ψ, we may conclude that φ ⊢ ψ ∨ (φ → ¬ψ). Not only does this fail—e.g., with the schematic letters replaced by distinct propositional variables—for ⊢I L, making the extension non-conservative, it takes us all the way to ⊢CL, as claimed in the general formulation ((i) and (ii)) of the result. To see this most easily in the present case, take φ as ⊤.

Does any of this mean that there is a problem in finding an intuitionistic analogue of exclusive disjunction? Not at all. There are many derived binary connectives all of which form compounds equivalent in classical logic to the exclusive disjunction of φ with ψ and which are in the interesting cases not equivalent to each other intuitionistically—for example, φ ↔ ¬ψ and ¬(φ ↔ ψ) and (φ ∨ ψ) ∧ ¬(φ ∧ ψ). As it happens, the third of these (which is IL-equivalent to (φ ∧ ¬ψ) ∨ (¬ φ ∧ ψ)) has an especially close relationship with the truth-function of exclusive disjunction, like that between intuitionistic ¬ and the negation truth-function, which can be explained in terms of the Kripke semantics for intuitionistic logic (not explained in this entry) by saying that the compound in question is true at a point just in case at every accessible point it is true when evaluated by using the corresponding boolean function and the truth-values of the components at that point.[37] Note that the negation truth-function itself has its determinant-induced conditions rules dangerous to the health of intuitionistic logic under both (i) and (ii) of the result at the start of this example: no single connective can conservatively form from a formula a contrary of that formula (as ⟨T, F⟩ demands) and also a subcontrary of that formula (as ⟨F, T⟩ demands). As it is often put, standard intuitionistic negation (¬) forms the deductively weakest contrary of a formula, while dual intuitionistic negation (mentioned only in passing in this entry) forms its deductively strongest subcontrary.[38]

4.3 Negation by Iteration (Example 3)

Could there be a 1-ary connective # two successive applications of which amounted to a single application of (say) classical negation?[39] If we work in Set-Set an austere version of this question amounts to asking about the fate of # subjected, alongside the standard structural rules, to the condition that for all φ:

φ, ##φ ≻  and  ≻ φ, ##φ

should both be provable, to which it is natural to add immediately that # should be congruential according to the generalized consequence relation associated with this proof system. Without the latter addition, we could just think of “##” as an idiosyncratically long-winded way of writing “¬”. With it, we are insisting that a single occurrence of “#” is genuinely responsive to the content of what it applies to. It is not hard to see that there is no (two-valued) truth-functional interpretation available for #, not just in the weak sense that it might be said that (for example) ☐ in S4 does not admit of such an interpretation—that this logic is determined by ( = both sound and complete with respect to) no class of valuations over which ☐ is truth-functional—but in the stronger sense that the envisaged logic of # is not even sound with respect to such a class of valuations, at least if that class is non-constant in the sense defined at the end of note 18.[40] In the paper cited, this congruential logic of what is there and in an earlier paper there referred to as demi-negation is discussed and equipped with a Kripke-style semantics (essentially re-working an earlier 4-valued matrix semantics) the upshot of which is that classical propositional logic or any fragment thereof is conservatively extended by the two zero-premiss rules inset above—or alternatively, assuming ¬ is in the fragment, by the equivalence of ¬φ and ##φ—and a congruentiality rule for #. Nevertheless it is hard to imagine, “from the inside”, speaking a language with a connective for which this provided a suitable formal treatment. The description suggested at p. 257 of Dalla Chiara, Giuntini, and Greechie (2004), a study in quantum logic, of such a connective as expressing a kind of tentative negation, seems wrong, since iterating tentative negation would not produce (untentative) negation: If you tentatively negate the tentative negation of φ you would appear to be headed (however tentatively) back in the direction of φ rather than towards ¬ φ. On the same page of Dalla Chiara et al. (2004), Deutsch et al. (2000) are approvingly quoted as saying the following—in which, since composition is more like multiplication than addition, demi-negation is referred to as the ‘square root’ of negation:

Logicians are now entitled to propose a new logical operation √not. Why? Because a faithful physical model for it exists in nature.

Well, thank you very much for your permission—though I do not recall logicians having to ask physicists whether their empirical work provided such an entitlement for what one would have thought to be an a priori matter: the coherence of a particular proposed connective. This is not at all to deny that the ‘quantum machines’ described in Deutsch et al. (2000) (Chiara, Giuntini, and Greechie (2004), 257–259) may help us get a feel for the meaning of the connective proposed.[41]

4.4 Logical Subtraction (Example 4)

Suppose one wants to say more about the weather than that it rained on a particular Saturday. One wants to strengthen one's commitments so that they include not only rain on Saturday but also rain on the following Sunday. With ∧ (assuming some background ∧-classical consequence relation) there is nothing easier. Abbreviating “It rained on the Saturday in question” to Sat and “It rained on Sunday” to Sun, one can convert one's original statement into one making the stronger claim by passing from Sat to Sat ∧ Sun. Now suppose one wanted a similar device but working in the reverse direction. One starts with a claim whose content is given by Sat ∧ Sun and wants to modify this using a connective which removes commitments in much the way that ∧ adds them, and using this connective, often called logical subtraction (though a case could be made for ‘logical division’ in view of the usual association of conjunction with multiplication), one wants to take away the commitment to rain on Sunday, leaving only the original claim. That is, one would like a connective added to the language of one's favoured consequence relation, in such a way that the added connective was governed by rules making the extension conservative, but for which one had the equivalence (writing ⊢) for the extended consequence relation:

(Sat ∧ Sun) − Sun ⊣⊢ Sat.

An early and plausible suggestion for the treatment of logical subtraction was made in Hudson (1975). According to this suggestion, no new connective is required, at least if we already have a reasonable implication connective at our disposal, because if we are to think of φ − ψ as giving us the result of taking away the content of ψ from that of φ, then this should be the weakest statement which, together with ψ, has φ as a consequence. But this is just ψ → φ, if the standard natural deduction rules for → from Section 2 are accepted (as in intuitionistic and classical logic). Yet this does not give us the inset equivalence above. If we treat (Sat ∧ Sun) − Sun as Sun → (Sat ∧ Sun), then this is equivalent (in the logics just mentioned and many others) to Sun → Sat, whereas we wanted the stronger Sat itself (stronger according to those logics, again).

The example above used an interpreted language with atomic sentences Sat and Sun. The inset equivalence presented involving them would not be reasonable for all sentences. Modulating back to the issue of a formal propositional logic involving the envisaged new connective, such an equivalence would not be reasonable for arbitrary φ and ψ in place of them, since we would expect the new connective to be congruential according to the desired consequence relation, and any unrestricted such equivalence would then deliver from φ1 ∧ ψ ⊣⊢ φ2 ∧ ψ—by “subtracting ψ from both sides” (in view of congruentiality)—the conclusion that φ1 ⊣⊢ φ2, and it easy to find counterexamples to such cancellation inferences for even quite weak initial logics. Since the counterexamples arise for φ1, φ2, in the language unexpanded by “−”, the sense in which a generalized version of the earlier equivalence would not be reasonable is that it would not be conservative over the initial logic. Here we say no more about how to constrain the equivalence in question, or, more generally, about whether there really exist any such logical subtraction connective as we have been envisaging.[42]

4.5 A Multiple Existence Question (Example 5)

A much more straightforward example, this time considering several connectives at once. Suppose we ask whether one can conservatively add to intuitionistic logic three binary connectives #1, #2, #3, satisfying for all φ, ψ:

φ ⊣⊢ (φ #1 ψ) → (φ #3 ψ)  and  ψ ⊣⊢ (φ #2 ψ) → (φ #3 ψ).

In classical logic we can take φ #1 ψ and φ #2 ψ as (equivalent to) ¬φ and ¬ψ respectively, and φ #3 ψ as ⊥. There are no three candidates playing the desired role in any conservative extension of intuitionistic logic, however, because the inset equivalences render arbitrary φ and ψ head-linked in the sense of Section 3, with φ #3 ψ as the head formula.

4.6 An Example Related to Algebraizability (Example 6)

Our final example comes from the relevant logic R. The sentential constants T and t whose sequent calculus treatment we saw in Section 3 are treated in axiomatic developments of R by means of the axiom schemas φ → T for the former cases and both t and t → (φ → φ), though these last two can be replaced by φ ↔ (t → φ). Here ↔ itself can be regarded as an abbreviation either of (φ → ψ) ∧ (ψ → φ), or as (φ → ψ) ○ (ψ → φ), where ∧ and ○ are the additive or ‘extensional’ (as the relevance tradition would have it) conjunction and the multiplicative or ‘intensional’ conjunction (also called fusion) respectively. While in linear logic neither p ○ q nor p ∧ q provably implies the other, in R, thanks to the presence of contraction, the latter implies the former.[43] A well-known further side effect of contraction is that φ ○ ψ and φ ∧ ψ are also equivalent whenever φ is an implicational formula and ψ is its converse, so the two alternative readings of φ ↔ ψ above are equivalent in R. Now consider the possible existence of a new nullary connective for R in the ‘truth constants’ family, T, subject to the axiom schema:

φ ↔ (T ↔ φ).

This looks harmless enough, the principles governing t, T and T all holding for the undifferentiated ⊤ constant of classical and intuitionistic logic, but here notationally distinguished so as not to prejudice questions of the logical relations between them.[44]

But in R, this harmless appearance is deceptive. For in this logic the connective ↔ is what we have called special. After the well-known extension, R-Mingle or RM, of R by the Mingle schema φ → (φ → φ),[45] let us call a formula φ for which this is already provable in R a Mingler. Since RM is a proper extension of R, not all formulas are Minglers in R. But again thanks to contraction, all ↔-formulas are Minglers, rendering ↔ special in R. Now we can see that the addition of T, subject to the schema inset above, would extend R non-conservatively because now every formula φ would be equivalent to the corresponding ↔-formula T ↔ φ, so even for T-free φ we should have the Mingle theorem φ → (φ → φ). Thus no devotee of R should be prepared to countenance the existence of T behaving as envisaged (or indeed any pair #1, #2 of 1-ary connectives with φ provably equivalent to #1φ ↔ #2φ).

The fact that the biconditional connective is special in R may appear to conflict with the fact, established in Blok and Pigozzi (1989) that this logic is what the authors call algebraizable. This term is applied to consequence relations ⊢ which are translationally equivalent to the quasi-equational consequence relation ⊨K of a class of algebras of the same similarity type as the language of ⊢. That is, for equations e1,…,en, we have e1,…,en−1⊨K en just in case for any algebra A ∈ K and any assignment of elements of A to the variables in the ei, if all of e1,…,en−1 come out true in A on that assignment, so does en. The translational equivalence idea means that there is a translation τ from formulas of the (sentential) language of ⊢ to equations of the language of K, and a translation τ′ back in the other direction, which are mutually inverse in the sense that φ ⊣⊢ τ′(τ(φ) and e ⫤⊨K τ(τ′(e)) for all formulas φ and equations e, and for, for all formulas φ1,…,φn and equations e1,…,en, either of the following conditions is satisfied (from which it follows that both are):

φ1,…,φn−1 ⊢ φn if and only if τ(φ1),…,τ(φn−1) ⊨K τ(φn)

and

e1,…,en−1 ⊨K en if and only if τ′(e1),…,τ′(en−1) ⊢ τ′(en).

This account of algebraizability has been oversimplified for expository purposes in one respect: Blok and Pigozzi (1989) do not require the translation of a formula (what we are calling τ) should yield a single equation, but allow a set of equations, and similarly in the converse direction, τ′(e) is allowed to be a set of formulas. The latter collectively function (it follows from the present definition, with the single equation/single formula restriction removed) that the formulas in the latter set function collectively as an equivalence-like compound satisfying some further congruence conditions, which in the case of ⊢R can be taken to ↔, so the fact that ⊢R—explained presently—is algebraizable, entails, in view of the “φ ⊣⊢ τ′(τ(φ))” condition, that, loosely speaking, every formula is equivalent to an equivalence. But does this not clash with our finding that ↔ is special in R?

Well, first, the consequence relation ⊢R needs to be explained. Blok and Pigozzi have in mind the least consequence relation for which φ, φ → ψ ⊢ ψ and φ, ψ⊢ φ ∧ ψ and ⊢ φ for all φ provable in the Fmla logic R. (This third condition can be restricted to all axioms of any axiomatization of R with formula-to-formula rules corresponding to the first and second conditions.) Now the loose summary just given to the effect that every formula is equivalent to an equivalence makes a misleading double use of the equivalence vocabulary for two different things: equivalence as mutual consequence (“⊣⊢”) and equivalence as the biconditional connective. Removing the conflation, it means that for every φ there exist ψ, χ, with φ ⊣⊢Rψ ↔ χ.[46] This is a very different matter from having ⊢Rφ ↔(ψ ↔ χ). The latter would indeed be equivalent to the provability in the sequent calculus described for R in Section 3 of φ ≻ ψ ↔ χ and the converse sequent. But the apparently matching ⊢R-statements mean something very different, building in the structural features (such as weakening) that the substructural sequent calculus was designed to avoid. Note in particular that ⊢R is not →-introductive, in the sense of Example 2 above.

5. Notes and Sources

The Galois connections described in the opening section are what are sometimes called contravariant (as opposed to covariant) Galois connections; they were introduced in somewhat different terminology by Garrett Birkhoff (1967). Closure operations as defined in the opening section are sometimes called closure operators. Note that the definition given, although standard, is much less restrictive than the notion of a specifically topological closure operation (in not requiring C(X ∪ Y) = C(X) ∪ C(Y) or C(∅) = ∅, in particular). Some authors discuss matters of logical theory placing a particular emphasis on closure operations and their systems of closed sets (sets X with C(X) = X); see Pollard and Martin (1996) and references there cited.

The phrase “logical frameworks” has been used in ways other than that introduced in Section 2, e.g., in Huet and Plotkin (1991). The use of “≻” here as a sequent separator is occasioned by current HTML font limitations; its general use for that purpose is not recommended. Carnap's observation about logic pursued in Set-Fmla not being capable of enforcing the intended truth-functional interpretation of various connectives (such as ∨, ¬, and →) has received extensive attention in the literature, references to which may be found in notes 5 and 27 of Humberstone (2000b). The term “congruential” used here is taken from Segerberg (1982); it is based on a related use of the term by D. Makinson (for modal logics in Fmla containing ☐ φ ↔ ☐ ψ whenever they contain φ ↔ ψ). In some quarters the term “self-extensional” is used for congruentiality, while in others the term “extensional”—used quite differently here—is used for this property.

The emphasis on (bivalent) valuations throughout our discussion may suggest some limitation of scope: are we not excluding ‘many-valued logic’ (or better: matrix semantics)? And what about Kripke style semantics in which truth is doubly relativized not only to a model but to a point therein? No, there is no limitation. Every (generalized) consequence relation is determined by a class of valuations. The matrix assignments of values to formulas are homomorphisms from the algebra L of formulas to the algebra A—presumed to be of the same similarity type of L—of a matrix (A, D), where D ⊆ A; D is called the set of designated elements of the matrix. Thus the compositional semantics is done in terms of such homomorphisms, any one of which, h, say, gives rise to a bivalent valuation vh defined by setting vh(φ) = T iff h(φ) ∈ D, and a Set-Fmla or Set-Set sequent is valid in the matrix just in case it holds—in the usual bivalent sense—on the valuation vh for every such homomorphism h, the (generalized) consequence relation determined by the matrix is the (generalized) consequence relation determined by the class of all such vh, etc.[47] Similarly for classes of matrices, with the quantification now over all vh where h is a homomorphism from the language to any matrix in the class. Likewise, in the Kripke-semantical case, any model M and point x therein gives rise to the valuation vMx defined by vMx(φ) = T iff M⊨x φ, and the (generalized) consequence relation determined by a class of models is that determined by all such vMx with M in the class. (This is the so-called local (generalized) consequence relation; for the global variant, use valuations vM with vM(φ) = T iff for all points x in the model, M⊨x φ.) There is an obvious further adaptation of these definitions if one wants a formulation in terms of determination by (“soundness and completeness with respect to”) a class of frames rather than models.

As well as Prior (1957) cited in Section 2 on the Ł-modal system, the following references are useful: Smiley (1961), Smiley (1962), Porte (1979), Font and Hájek (2002). The original paper is Łukasiewicz (1953).

The problem with a live-and-let-live attitude toward differences between logics differing over the logical powers of a connective when the weaker set of powers already suffice for unique characterization (¬i vs. ¬c in Section 3) was already pointed out in Popper (1948), and often re-surfaces in subsequent literature e.g., Harris (1982), Hand (1993), Humberstone (1984), Fariñas del Cerro and Herzig (1996); the third of these is the abstract of a paper on which the remarks on unique characterization in Section 3 of the present entry is largely based. A revised version of the paper appears as §4.3 of the monograph Humberstone (2011a), on which many of the other topics touched on here are treated in greater detail (though some issues are addressed in greater detail here). Uniquely characterized connectives are sometimes spoken of as implicitly defined, but there are definite risks involved in the latter usage—see Došen and Schroeder-Heister (1985). The “implicit” in the title of Caicedo (2004) does not carry quite the same risks, and refers to a special case of unique characterization, essentially amounting to unique characterization by zero-premiss rules in Fmla—i.e., by axioms. Similarly, the “functionally dependent” connectives of Smiley (1962) are those uniquely characterized by zero-premiss rules, taken in concert with the standard structural rules, in Set-Fmla—though Smiley's definition is put in terms of consequence relations. This class of connectives may well coincide with the class of projection-conjunction connectives. It does not include disjunction or implication, as treated in intuitionistic or classical logic, which are uniquely characterized by rules essentially containing a non-zero-premiss rule—though these would be uniquely characterized by zero-premiss rules (together with the structural rules) in Set-Set. Makinson (2014) also addresses questions of existence and uniqueness in connection with connectives, but his existence questions concern, not the existence of a connective satisfying certain rules (or more generally, certain conditions), but the existence of rules (or this or that kind) satisfied by a given connective, where connectives are individuated semantically (more specifically, by association with bivalent truth-functions). The various notions of uniqueness considered by Makinson do apply to connectives rather than rules, and are defined in terms of the rules satisfied but the connectives themselves are again individuated truth-functionally and so none ends up amouting to unique characterization as understood here. See note 1, p. 365, in Makinson (2014) for a discussion contrasting his concerns with those found “in some proof-theoretic studies”, and citing Došen and Schroeder-Heister (1988). (In fact in the footnote, though not in the bibliography, the date is given as 1998.)

Id-inductivity is called ‘regularity’ in Kaminski (1988); for Id-inductivity and Cut-inductivity and related concepts (under different names), see also Ciabattoni (2004) and Ciabattoni and Terui (2006).

A study of Popper's generally under-appreciated work in logic is provided in Schroeder-Heister (1984). The faulty view that differences over logic amount to talking at cross purposes was defended in writings by W. V. Quine to which references may be found in Morton (1973), where this view is subjected to a somewhat milder version of the criticism in Section 3. A full discussion of substructural logics, also mentioned in Section 3, and related topics is provided in Restall (2000).

Aside from the papers by Prior, Belnap, Stevenson and Peacocke (and Read's book (1988)) mentioned in Section 3, the Tonk example is discussed in (at least) the following places: Wagner (1981), Hart (1982), §4.12 in Tennant (1978). Interest continues unabated, as witnessed by the following publications from the period 2004–2006 alone: Hodes (2004), Cook (2005), Tennant (2005), Bonnay and Simmenauer (2005), Chapter 5 of Priest (2006) and Wansing (2006). Subsequent treatments of interest include Avron (2010) and Rahmann (2012). Although Tonk is Prior's best known example of non-conservative extension, he also noted the non-conservative effect of familiar logical principles concerning conjunction when added to a purely implicational intermediate logic; references, details, and further discussion can be found in Humberstone (2014). For the notion – or perhaps better, notions – of harmony between rules (especially in natural deduction), see the Tonk references just given, and also Chapter 23 of Tennant (1987), Weir (1986), Dummett (1991) (passim), Milne (1994) and (2002), and Read (2000), as well as the following more recent investigations: Read (2010), Steinberger (2011), Francez and Dyckhoff (2012), Hjortland (2012), Francez (2014), Milne (2015), Read (2015), Schroeder-Heister (2015). For general background in proof-theoretic semantics informing these discussions, two useful references are Schroeder-Heister (2014) and the editor's contribution (Chapter 1) to Wansing (2015). The subject of harmony is also briefly touched on in Makinson (2014), esp. p. 369.

Material of interest on the subjects of special and universally representative connectives can be found in Jankov (1969), Pahi (1971), de Jongh and Chagrova (1995), in addition to the references cited in Section 3. For the fact that the relation of head linkage is special in intuitionistic logic, see Urquhart (1974) and §7 of Humberstone (2001), or 9.25 in Humberstone (2011a), the whole of Chapter 9 of which is devoted to the subject of special and universally representative connectives. Expanding on note 42: Section 5.2 of this same book goes into more detail on logical subtraction (Example 4, under 4.4 above); interesting work by Stephen Yablo on this same topic, mentioned as then unpublished in the Notes and References to §5.2 of Humberstone (2011a), has since made an appearance: see Yablo (2014), especially Chapters 8 and 9.

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Acknowledgments

I am grateful to Thomas Hendrey for drawing my attention (in 2011) to an error in the previous version of this entry, at a point in Section 2 after the formulation of the rules (∧I) and (∧E), where the discussion included the following: “Typically ⊢ will also be determined by many further classes of valuations (meaning: other than the class Val(⊢) of all valuations consistent with ⊢), various subsets of Val(⊢), but not so, as just remarked, in the present case.” By “the present case” was meant the case of ⊢ = ⊢∧. As Hendrey pointed out, this consequence relation is determined by numerous proper subsets of the set of all ∧-boolean valuations, so the claim is false. In a moment of inattention I had confusingly passed from the correct thought that the only valuations consistent with ⊢∧ are the ∧-boolean ones to the faulty conclusion that the only class of valuations determining ⊢∧ is the class of all ∧-boolean valuations. (Many counterexamples could be given to this latter claim but one offered by Hendrey is particularly interesting: the class of all those ∧-boolean valuations with the further property that they make at most one sentence letter false.) The reference to subsets of Val(⊢) was ill-conceived, since the point of contrast with, e.g., ⊢∨, taken as the consequence relation (on the language with sole connective ∨) determined by the class of all ∨-boolean valuations is also determined by classes of valuations which are not subsets of this class since we can include also conjunctive combinations of ∨-boolean valuations. By contrast, ⊢∧ can only be determined by classes of valuations all of which are ∧-boolean.

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Lloyd Humberstone <lloyd.humberstone@arts.monash.edu.au>

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