Supplement to Death
The Argument: Death and Posthumous Events Don’t Affect Us
Here is a more explicit version of 1–13 (with thanks to Curtis Brown):
Let \(s,s',\ldots\) range over subjects; \(v,v',\ldots\) over events and states; and \(t,t',\ldots\) over times. We can use the following abbreviations:
| \(\SD(v,s,t)\): | \(v\) is the state of \(s\) being dead at \(t\) |
| \(\harm 2(v,s)\): | \(v\) harms \(s\) |
| \(\harm 3(v,s,t)\): | \(v\) harms \(s\) at \(t\) |
| \(t \gt\) t’: | \(t\) is after \(t'\) |
| \(t \ge t'\): | \(t\) is after \(t'\) or \(t = t'\) |
We can use the following function symbols:
For any subject \(s\), \(\ED(s)\) is the event of \(s\)’s death
For any event or state \(v\), T\((v)\) is the time \(v\) occurs or holds
Next come axioms:
| A1. | \(\forall v\forall s(\harm 2(v,s)\) iff \(\exists t \harm 3(v,s,t))\) |
| A2. | \(\forall v\forall s(v\) is posthumous for \(s\) iff T\((v) \gt \T(\ED(s)))\) |
| A3. | \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\)(If \(\SD(v,s)\), then \(t \gt \T(\ED(s)))\) |
Then premises:
| P1. | \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\) (If \(v\) affects \(s\) at \(t\), then \(v\) causally affects \(s\) at \(t)\) |
| P2. | \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\) (If \(v\) causally affects \(s\) at \(t\), then \(s\) exists at \(t)\) |
| P3. | \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\) (If \(\harm 3(v,s,t)\), then \(v\) affects \(s\) at \(t)\) |
| P4. | \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\) (If \(v\) causally affects \(s\) at \(t\), then \(t \ge\) T\((v))\) |
| P5. | \(\forall v\forall s\) (If \(t \gt \T(\ED(s))\), then it is not the case that \(s\) exists at \(t)\) |
Here are the conclusions to be reached:
| C1. | No posthumous event harms us; i.e., \(\forall v\forall s\) (If \(v\) is posthumous for \(s\), then \({\sim}\harm 2(v,s))\) |
| C2. | We are not harmed by the state of our being dead; i.e., \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\) (If \(\SD(v,s,t)\), then \({\sim}\harm 2(v,s))\) |
| C3. | The event of death harms us, if at all, only when it occurs;
i.e., \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\) (If \(v=\ED(s) \amp \harm 3(v,s,t)\), then \(t = \T(\ED(s)))\) |
Argument for C1:
Let \(v_{1}\) be any event or state, \(s_{1}\) any subject and \(t_{1}\) any time.
| 1. | \(v_{1}\) is posthumous for \(s_{1}\) | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | \(\harm 2(v_{1}, s_{1})\) | (assumption for reductio ad absurdum) |
| 3. | \(\T(v_{1}) \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))\) | (1, A2, UI, biconditional elimination) |
| 4. | \(\harm 3(v_{1}, s_{1},t)\) | (2, A1, UI, biconditional elimination, MP) |
| 5. | \(\harm 3(v_{1}\), \(s_{1}, t_{1})\) | (4, EI) |
| 6. | \(v_{1}\) affects \(s_{1}\) at \(t_{1}\) | (5, P3, UI, MP) |
| 7. | \(v_{1}\) causally affects \(s_{1}\) at \(t_{1}\) | (6, P1, UI, MP) |
| 8. | \(t_{1} \gt \T(v_{1})\) | (7, P4, UI, MP) |
| 9. | \(t_{1} \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))\) | (8, 3, transitivity of \(\gt)\) |
| 10. | \({\sim}s_{1}\) exists at \(t_{1}\) | (9, P5, UI, MP) |
| 11. | \(s_{1}\) exists at \(t_{1}\) | (7, P2, UI, MP) |
| 12. | \({\sim}\harm 2(v_{1}, s_{1})\) | (2, 10,11, reductio ad absurdum |
| 13. | If \(v_{1}\) is posthumous for s \(_{1}\), then \({\sim}\harm 2(v_{1}, s_{1})\) | (1, 13, conditional introduction) |
| 14. | \(\forall v\forall s\)(If \(v\) is posthumous for \(s\), then \({\sim}\harm 2(v,s))\) | (13 UG) |
Argument for C2:
Let \(v_{1}\) be any event or state, \(s_{1}\) any subject and t \(_{1}\) any time.
| 1. | \(\SD(v_{1}, s_{1}, t_{1})\) | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | \(t_{1} \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))\) | (1, A3, UI, MP)) |
| 3. | \(v_{1}\) is posthumous for \(s_{1}\) | (2, A2, biconditional elimination) |
| 4. | \({\sim}\harm 2(v_{1}, s_{1})\) | (3, C1, UI, MP) |
| 5. | If \(\SD(v_{1}, s_{1}, t_{1})\), then \({\sim} \harm 2( v_{1}, s_{1})\) |
(1, 4, CI) |
| 6. | \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\) (If \(\SD(v,s,t)\), then \({\sim}\harm 2(v,s))\) | (5, UG) |
Argument for C3:
Let \(v_{1}\) be any event or state, \(s_{1}\) any subject and \(t_{1}\) any time.
| 1. | \(v_{1} =\ED(s_{1}) \amp \harm 3(v_{1}, s_{1},t_{1})\) | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | \(\harm 3(\ED(s_{1}),s_{1},t_{1})\) | (1, simplication, substitution) |
| 3. | \(\ED(s_{1})\) affects \(s_{1}\) at \(t_{1}\) | (2, P3, UI, MP) |
| 4. | \(\ED(s_{1})\) causally affects \(s_{1}\) at \(t_{1}\) | (3, P1, UI, MP) |
| 5. | \(t_{1} \ge \T(\ED(s_{1}))\) | (4, P4, UI, MP) |
| 6. | \(t_{1} \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))\) | (assumption for reductio ad absurdum) |
| 7. | \({\sim}s_{1}\) exists at \(t_{1}\) | (6, P5, UI, MP) |
| 8. | \(s_{1}\) exists at \(t_{1}\) | (4, P2, UI, MP) |
| 9. | \({\sim}t_{1} \gt \T(\ED(s_{1}))\) | (6, 8, reductio ad absurdum) |
| 10. | \(t_{1} = \T(\ED(s_{1}))\) | (5, 9, disjunctive syllogism) |
| 11. | If \(v_{1}=\ED(s_{1})\amp \harm 3(v_{1}, s_{1} , t_{1})\), then \(t_{1} =\T(\ED(s_{1}))\) | (1, 10, conditional introduction) |
| 12. | \(\forall v\forall s\forall t\) (If \(v=\ED(s) \amp \harm 3(v,s,t)\), then \(t = \T(\ED((s))\) | (11, UG) |
