Notes to Epiphenomenalism

1. Strictly speaking, one can distinguish two versions of epiphenomenalism, (a) mental events have no effects; and (b) mental events may have effects on other mental events, so long as the latter do not have any physical effects, nor any effects on further mental events that eventually have any physical effects. Because observing this distinction would contribute nothing but a tedious duplication of arguments that would differ only trivially, it will be ignored in the remainder of the article.