Voluntary Euthanasia
The entry sets out five conditions often said to be necessary for anyone to be a candidate for legalized voluntary euthanasia (and, with appropriate qualifications, physician-assisted suicide), outlines the moral case advanced by those in favor of legalizing voluntary euthanasia, and discusses the five most important objections made by those who deny that voluntary euthanasia is morally permissible and who are, in consequence, opposed to its being legalized.
- 1. Introduction
- 2. Five Conditions Often Proposed as Necessary for Candidacy for Voluntary Euthanasia
- 3. A Moral Case for Voluntary Euthanasia
- 4. Five Objections to the Moral Permissibility of Voluntary Euthanasia
- Bibliography
- Academic Tools
- Other Internet Resources
- Related Entries
1. Introduction
When a person carries out an act of euthanasia, she brings about the death of another person because she believes the latter's present existence is so bad that he would be better off dead, or believes that unless she intervenes and ends his life, his life will become so bad that he would be better off dead. Thus, the motive of the person who commits an act of euthanasia is to benefit the one whose death is brought about. (This also holds for many instances of physician-assisted suicide, but some wish to restrict the use of the latter term to forms of assistance which stop short of the physician ‘bringing about the death’ of the patient, for example, those involving mechanical means that have to be activated by the patient.)
It is important to emphasize the motive of benefiting the person who is assisted to die because well-being is a key value in relation to the morality of euthanasia. Nonetheless, the defensibility of the contention that someone can be better off dead has been the subject of extensive philosophical deliberation. Those who claim that a person can be better off dead believe this to be true when the life that remains in prospect for that person has no positive value for her (a possibility which is discussed by e.g., Foot, 1977; McMahan 2002, ch. 2; Bradley 2009), whereas some of those who hold that a person's life is inviolable deny that a person can ever be better off dead (e.g., Keown in Jackson and Keown 2012). A Kant-inspired variant on this latter position has been advanced by Velleman (1999). He considers that a person's well-being can only matter if she is of intrinsic value and so that it is impermissible to violate a person's rational nature (the source of her intrinsic value) for the sake of her well-being. Accordingly, he holds that it is impermissible to assist someone to die who judges that she would be better off dead and competently requests assistance with dying. The only exception is when a person's life is so degraded as to call into question her rational nature, albeit he thinks it unlikely that anyone in that position will remain competent to request assistance with dying. This position appears to be incompatible with the well-established right of a competent patient to refuse life-prolonging medical treatment, at least when further treatment is refused because she considers that her life no longer has value for her. (For further reasons to reject arguments for the inviolability of the life of a person, including Velleman's, see e.g., McMahan 2002, Young 2007 and Sumner 2011.)
Because our concern will be with voluntary euthanasia — that is, with those instances of euthanasia in which a clearly competent person makes a voluntary and enduring request to be helped to die (or, by extension, when an authorised person makes a substituted judgment by choosing in the manner the no-longer-competent person would have chosen had he remained competent), a second key value is the competence of the person requesting assistance with dying. There will be occasion to mention non-voluntary euthanasia — instances of euthanasia where a person is either not competent, or unable, at the time to express a wish about euthanasia and has not previously expressed a wish for it — only when consideration is given to the claim that permitting voluntary euthanasia will lead via a slippery slope to permitting non-voluntary euthanasia. Nothing will be said here about involuntary euthanasia, where a competent person's life is brought to an end despite an explicit expression of opposition to euthanasia, beyond saying that, no matter how honorable the perpetrator's motive, such a death is, and ought to be, unlawful.
Debate about the morality and legality of voluntary euthanasia has been, for the most part, a phenomenon of the second half of the twentieth century and the beginning of the twenty first century. Certainly, the ancient Greeks and Romans did not believe that life needed to be preserved at any cost and were, in consequence, tolerant of suicide in cases when no relief could be offered to the dying or, in the case of the Stoics and Epicureans, when a person no longer cared for his life. In the sixteenth century, Thomas More, in describing a utopian community, envisaged such a community as one that would facilitate the death of those whose lives had become burdensome as a result of ‘torturing and lingering pain’. But it has only been in the last hundred years that there have been concerted efforts to make legal provision for voluntary euthanasia. Until quite recently, there had been no success in obtaining such legal provision (though assisted suicide, including, but not limited to, physician-assisted suicide, has been legally tolerated in Switzerland for many years). However, the outlook changed dramatically in the 1970s and 80s because of a series of court cases in The Netherlands which culminated in an agreement between the legal and medical authorities to ensure that no physician would be prosecuted for assisting a patient to die as long as certain guidelines were strictly adhered to (see Griffiths, et al. 1998). In brief, the guidelines were established to permit physicians to practise voluntary euthanasia in those instances in which a competent patient had made a voluntary and informed request to be helped to die, the patient's suffering was unbearable, there was no way of making that suffering bearable that was acceptable to the patient, and the physician's judgements as to diagnosis and prognosis were confirmed after consultation with another physician. In the 1990s, the first legislative approval for voluntary euthanasia was achieved with the passage of a bill in the parliament of Australia's Northern Territory to enable physicians to practise voluntary euthanasia. Subsequent to the Act's proclamation in 1996, it faced a series of legal challenges from opponents of voluntary euthanasia. In 1997 the challenges culminated in the Australian National Parliament overturning the legislation when it prohibited Australian Territories (the Australian Capital Territory and the Northern Territory) from enacting legislation to permit euthanasia. In Oregon in the United States, legislation was introduced in 1997 to permit physician-assisted suicide after a referendum clearly endorsed the proposed legislation. Later in 1997, the Supreme Court of the United States ruled that there is no constitutional right to physician-assisted suicide; however, the Court did not preclude individual states from legislating in favor of physician-assisted suicide (so the Oregon legislation remained in force). Since that time the Oregon legislation has been successfully utilised by a significant number of people. Similar legislation was passed in the state of Washington in 2009 and in the state of Vermont in 2013. A series of judicial decisions in the state of Montana in 2008 and 2009 established that the state could not prohibit physician-assisted suicide but legislation has not yet been introduced to codify the legal situation. A similar legal position has obtained in Colombia since the late 1990s as a result of a majority ruling by the Constitutional Court in favor of the legality of physician-assisted suicide. In November 2000, The Netherlands passed legislation to legalize the practice of voluntary euthanasia. The legislation passed through all the parliamentary stages early in 2001. The Belgian parliament passed similar legislation in May 2002. Luxembourg followed suit in 2009. (For a very helpful comparative study of relevant legislation see Lewis 2007. See also Griffiths, et al. 2008.)
With that brief sketch of the historical background in place, we will now proceed to set out the conditions that those who have advocated making voluntary euthanasia legally permissible have typically insisted should be satisfied. Stating the conditions will provide a framework for the moral debate that will enable us to consider whether there are moral grounds for opposing the legalization of voluntary euthanasia (and physician-assisted suicide). Second, we will go on to outline the positive moral case underpinning the push to make voluntary euthanasia legally permissible. Third, we will then consider the most important moral objections that have been advanced by those opposed to the legalization of voluntary euthanasia.
2. Five Conditions Often Proposed as Necessary for Candidacy for Voluntary Euthanasia
Advocates of voluntary euthanasia typically contend that if a person
- is suffering from a terminal illness;
- is unlikely to benefit from the discovery of a cure for that illness during what remains of her life expectancy;
- is, as a direct result of the illness, either suffering intolerable pain, or only has available a life that is unacceptably burdensome (e.g., because the illness has to be treated in ways that lead to her being unacceptably dependent on others or on technological means of life support);
- has an enduring, voluntary and competent wish to die (or has, prior to losing the competence to do so, expressed a wish to be assisted to die in the event that conditions (a)-(c) are satisfied); and
- is unable without assistance to end her life,
then there should be legal and medical provision to enable her to be allowed to die or to be assisted to die.
It should be acknowledged that these conditions are quite restrictive, indeed more restrictive than some would think appropriate. In particular, the first condition restricts access to voluntary euthanasia to those who are terminally ill. While that expression is not free of all ambiguity, for present purposes it can be agreed that it does not include victims of accidents who are rendered quadriplegics, sufferers from motor neurone disease, or individuals who succumb to forms of dementia like Alzheimer's Disease, to say nothing of those afflicted by 'existential suffering'. Those who consider that cases like these show the first condition to be too restrictive (e.g., Sumner 2011; Varelius 2014) may, nonetheless, agree that including them as candidates for legalized voluntary euthanasia would make it far harder in many jurisdictions to gain sufficient support for legalization (and so make it harder to help those terminally ill persons who wish to die). Even so, they believe that euthanasia should be permitted for those who consider their lives no longer worth living, not just for for the terminally ill. The fifth condition further restricts access to voluntary euthanasia by excluding those capable of ending their own lives, and so may be thought unduly restrictive by those who would wish to discourage terminally ill patients from attempting suicide. There will be yet others who consider this condition to be too restrictive because competent patients can always refuse nutrition and hydration. (While this is true, many competent dying persons still wish to have access to legalized medically assisted death, rather than having to rely on refusing nutrition and hydration, so as to retain control over the timing of their deaths, and to avoid needlessly prolonging the process of dying.)
The second condition is intended simply to reflect the fact that it is normally possible to say when someone's health status is incurable. So-called ‘miracle’ cures may be spoken of by sensationalist journalists, but progress toward medical breakthroughs is typically painstaking. If there are miracles wrought by God that will be quite another matter entirely, but it is at least clear that not everyone's death is thus to be staved off.
The third condition recognises what many who oppose the legalization of voluntary euthanasia do not, namely, that it is not only a desire to be released from pain that leads people to request help with dying. In The Netherlands, for example, pain has been found to be a less significant reason for requesting assistance with dying than other forms of suffering, including frustration over loss of independence. Sufferers from some terminal conditions may have their pain relieved but have to endure side effects that, for them, make life unbearable. Others may not have to cope with pain but instead be incapable of living without forms of life support that simultaneously rob their lives of quality (as with, e.g., motor neurone disease).
A final preliminary point is that the fourth condition requires that the choice to die not only be uncoerced and competent but that it be enduring. The choice is one that will require discussion as well as time for reflection and so should not be settled in a moment. As with other decisions affecting matters of importance, competent adults are presumed to choose voluntarily unless the presence of defeating considerations can be established. (See the entry on decision-making capacity.) The burden of proof of establishing lack of voluntariness or lack of competence is on those who refuse to accept the person's choice. There is no need to deny that this burden can sometimes be met (e.g., by pointing to the person's being in a state of clinical depression). The claim is only that the onus falls on those who assert that a normal adult's choice is not competent. (For a fuller discussion of issues concerning the definition of 'euthanasia' see, e.g., Beauchamp and Davidson 1979.)
3. A Moral Case for Voluntary Euthanasia
One central ethical contention in support of voluntary euthanasia is that respect for persons demands respect for their autonomous choices as long as those choices do not result in harm to others. Respect for people's autonomous choices is directly connected with the requirement for competence because autonomy presupposes competence (cf., Brock 1992). People have an interest in making important decisions about their lives in accordance with their own conception of how they want to live. In exercising autonomy, or self-determination, individuals take responsibility for their lives; since dying is a part of life, choices about the manner of their dying and the timing of their death are, for many people, part of what is involved in taking responsibility for their lives. Many are concerned about what the last phase of their lives will be like, not merely because of fears that their dying might involve them in great suffering, but also because of the desire to retain their dignity, and as much control over their lives as possible, during this phase. A second contention in support of voluntary euthanasia was mentioned at the beginning of this article, namely the importance of promoting the well-being of persons. When someone is suffering intolerable pain or only has available a life that is unacceptably burdensome (see the third condition above), and he competently requests medical assistance with dying, his well-being may best be promoted by affording him that assistance. In this way the central values underpinning voluntary euthanasia, the individual's autonomy and well-being, work together (see, e.g., Young 2007; Sumner 2011).
The technological interventions of modern medicine have had the effect of stretching out the time it takes for many people to die. Sometimes the added life this brings is an occasion for rejoicing; sometimes it drags out the period of significant physical and intellectual decline that a person undergoes with the result that life becomes no longer worth living. Many believe there is no single, objectively correct answer as to when, if at all, a person's life becomes a burden and hence unwanted. If they are right, that simply points up the importance of individuals being able to decide autonomously for themselves whether their own lives retain sufficient quality and dignity to make life worth living. Others think that individuals can be in error about whether their lives continue to be worth living (cf., Foot 1977). Conditions (a) – (e) outlined earlier are intended inter alia by those who propose them to act as a safeguard against such error. But it is worth adding that in the event that a person who considers that she satisfies those conditions is judged by her medical attendants to be in error about whether it would be worth her going on living, the likely outcome is that those attendants will refuse to provide medical assistance with dying. (Evidence that will be introduced below shows that this happens frequently in jurisdictions in which medically assisted dying has been legalized.) Unless a patient is able to be transferred to the care of other medical professionals who accept her assessment, she will have to rely on her own resources (e.g., by refusing nutrition and hydration). Even so, other things being equal, as long as a critically ill person is competent, her own judgement of whether continued life is a benefit to her ought to carry the greatest weight in any end-of-life decision making regardless of whether she is in a severely compromised and debilitated state. The idea that autonomy should trump well-being in this way ought not to be thought surprising because precisely the same happens when a competent patient refuses life-prolonging treatment.
Suppose, for the sake of argument, that it is agreed that we should respect a person's competent request for medical assistance with dying (e.g., so as to enable her to achieve her autonomously chosen goal of an easeful death). It might be thought that in such an eventuality different moral concerns will be introduced from those that arise in connection with competent refusals. After all, while competent patients are entitled to refuse any form of medical treatment, they are not entitled to insist on the administration of forms of medical treatment that have no prospect of conferring a medical benefit or are not provided for reasons to do with affordability. Nevertheless, despite these differences, it remains the case that medical personnel have a duty to relieve suffering when that is within their capacity. Accordingly, when a dying patient requests assistance with dying in order to avoid unnecessary suffering it is certainly morally permissible for attending medical personnel to provide aid with dying. The reason for claiming only that this is morally permissible rather than morally obligatory will be explained in the following paragraph. (For helpful reflections on this matter see, for instance, Dworkin in Frey, et al. 1998; Sumner 2011.) Notwithstanding this response, at least some will wish to question why medical assistance with dying should be restricted to those covered by, in particular, the first three conditions set out above in section 2. If people's competent requests for medically assisted death should be respected why impose any restrictions at all on who may have access to medically assisted death? Why, for example, should those suffering from depression, or forms of dementia, not be eligible for medically assisted dying? Proponents of medically assisted dying hold that there are at least two reasons for restricting access to medically assisted dying to those who satisfy the conditions set out earlier. First, they contend that there are political grounds for doing so, namely, that because legalizing medically assisted dying for competent individuals is politically contested, the best hope for its legalization lies in focussing on those forms of suffering most likely to motivate law reform. That is why some proponents even deny that sufferers from conditions like 'locked-in' syndrome, motor neurone disease, and multiple sclerosis should be eligible for medically assisted dying since, strictly, they are not terminally ill. Second, and relatedly, proponents of the legalization of medical assistance with dying have been cautious about supporting medically assisted death for those suffering from, for example, clinical depression and dementia, because they not only are not terminally ill, but are apt to have their competence called into question. Restricting access to legalized medical assistance to those whose suffering is less likely to be disputed avoids becoming embroiled in needless controversy. Some critics of the restrictive approach (e.g., Varelius 2014) take a harder line still and claim that it should not even be necessary for a person to be suffering from a medical condition to be eligible for medical assistance with dying; it should be enough to be 'tired of life'. Only in the two jurisdictions where medically assisted dying has been available for a number of decades, viz., Switzerland and The Netherlands, has this issue been seriously broached. Regardless of what may happen in those jurisdictions, those seeking the legal provision of medical assistance with dying in other jurisdictions seem likely to want to maintain that if such assistance is to be seen as a form of medical care it ought to be provided in response to a medical condition (rather than because someone is 'tired of life'), and further restricted to those who satisfy conditions a-c as outlined earlier in section 2.
There is one final matter on which comment should be made. The comment concerns a point foreshadowed in the previous paragraph, but it also links with the remark just made, namely, that it is important to show respect for the professional autonomy of any medical personnel asked to lend assistance with dying. The value (or, as some would prefer, the right) of self-determination does not entitle a patient to try to compel a medical professional to act contrary to her own moral or professional values. Hence, if voluntary euthanasia is to be legally permitted, it must be against a backdrop of respect for professional autonomy. Similarly, if a doctor's view of her moral or professional responsibilities is at odds with her patient's competent request for euthanasia, provision should be made, where feasible, for the transfer of the patient to the care of a doctor who faces no such conflict. Given that, to date, those who contend that no scope should be permitted for conscientious objection within medical practice have garnered very little support for that view among medical professionals, making use of referrals and transfers remains the most effective means of resolving such disagreements.
Opponents of voluntary euthanasia have endeavored in a variety of ways to counter the very straightforward moral case that has been laid out above for its legalization (see, for example, Keown 2002; Foley, et al. 2002; Biggar 2004; Gorsuch 2006). Some of the counter-arguments are concerned only with whether the moral case warrants making the practice of voluntary euthanasia legal, whereas others are concerned with trying to undermine the moral case itself. In what follows, consideration will be given to the five most important counter-arguments. (For more comprehensive discussions of the ethics of medically assisted death see Keown 2002; Biggar 2004; Gorsuch 2006; Young 2007; Sumner 2011.)
4. Five Objections to the Moral Permissibility of Voluntary Euthanasia
Objection 1
It is sometimes said (e.g., Emanuel 1999; Keown in Jackson and Keown 2012) that it is not necessary nowadays for people to die while suffering from intolerable or overwhelming pain because the provision of effective palliative care has improved steadily, and hospice care is more widely available. Some have urged, in consequence, that voluntary euthanasia is unnecessary.
There are several flaws in this contention. First, while both good palliative care and hospice care make important contributions to the care of the dying, neither is a panacea. To get the best palliative care for an individual involves trial and error, with some consequent suffering in the process, and even the best care may fail to relieve all pain and suffering. Perhaps more importantly, high quality palliative care commonly exacts a price in the form of side-effects such as nausea, incontinence, loss of awareness because of semi-permanent drowsiness, and so on. A rosy picture is often painted as to how palliative care can transform the plight of the dying. Such a picture is misleading according to those who have closely observed the effect of extended courses of treatment with drugs like morphine. Many skilled palliative care specialists acknowledge that palliative care does not enable an easeful death for every patient. Second, even though the sort of care provided through hospices is to be applauded, it is care that is available to only a small proportion of the terminally ill and then usually only in the very last stages of the illness (typically a matter of a few weeks). Notwithstanding that only relatively few of the dying have access to hospice care it is worth drawing attention to the fact that in, for example, Oregon, a high proportion of those who have sought physician-assisted suicide were in hospice care. Third, and of great significance, not everyone wishes to avail themselves of palliative or hospice care. For those who prefer to die on their own terms and in their own time, neither option may be attractive. As previously mentioned, a major source of distress for many dying patients is the frustration that comes with being unable to satisfy their autonomous wishes. Fourth, as indicated earlier, the suffering that occasions a wish to end life is not always due to pain caused by illness. For some, what is intolerable is their forced dependence on others or on machinery; for these patients, the availability of effective pain control is not the primary concern. (In relation to the preceding matters see Rietjens, et al., 2009 and Onwuteaka-Philipsen et al. 2012 for findings for The Netherlands, and, for Oregon, Ganzini, et al. 2009.)
Objection 2
A second, related objection to the moral and legal permissibility of voluntary euthanasia turns on the claim that we can never have sufficient evidence to be justified in believing that a dying person's request to be helped to die is competent, enduring and genuinely voluntary.
It is certainly true that a request to die may not reflect an enduring desire to die (just as some attempts to commit suicide may reflect only temporary despair). That is why advocates of voluntary euthanasia have argued that normally a cooling off period should be required before euthanasia is permitted to ensure that the request is enduring. That having been said, to claim that we can never be justified in believing that someone's request to die reflects a settled preference for death is to go too far. If a competent person discusses the issue with others on different occasions over time and remains steady in her resolve, or reflects on the issue for an extended period and does not waver in her conviction, her wish to die surely must be counted as enduring.
But, it might be asked, what if a person is racked with pain, or mentally confused because of the measures taken to relieve her pain, and is, in consequence, unable to think clearly and rationally about the alternatives? It has to be agreed that a person in those circumstances who wants to die should not be assumed to have a competent, enduring and truly voluntary desire to die. However, there are at least two important points to make about those in such circumstances. First, they do not account for all of the terminally ill, so even if it is acknowledged that such people are incapable of agreeing to voluntary euthanasia that does not show that no one can ever voluntarily request help to die. Second, it is possible in at least some jurisdictions for a person to indicate, in advance of losing the capacity to give competent, enduring and voluntary consent, how she would wish to be treated should she become terminally ill and suffer either intolerable pain or an unacceptable loss of control over her life (cf., for instance, Dworkin 1993). ‘ Living wills’ or ‘advance directives’ are legal instruments for giving voice to people's wishes while they are capable of giving competent, enduring and voluntary consent, including to their wanting help to die. As long as they are easily revocable in the event of a change of mind (just as civil wills are), they should be respected as evidence of a well thought-out conviction. (For more detailed consideration of these instruments see the entry on advance directives.)
Perhaps, though, what is really at issue in this objection is whether anyone can ever form a competent, enduring and voluntary judgement about being better off dead, rather than continuing to suffer from an illness, prior to suffering such an illness (cf., Keown in Jackson and Keown 2012). If this is what underlies the objection it is surely too paternalistic to be acceptable. Why is it not possible for a person to have sufficient inductive evidence (e.g., based on the experience of the deaths of friends or family) to know her own mind, without having direct experience of such suffering, and act accordingly?
Objection 3
According to one interpretation of the traditional ‘doctrine of double effect’ it is permissible to act in ways which it is foreseen will have bad consequences, provided only that
- this occurs as a side-effect (or indirectly) to the achievement of the act that is directly aimed at;
- the act directly aimed at is itself morally good or, at least, morally neutral;
- the good effect is not achieved by way of the bad, that is, the bad must not be a means to the good; and
- the bad effect must not be so serious as to outweigh the good effect.
According to the doctrine of double effect, it is, for example, permissible to alleviate pain (a good effect) by administering a drug such as morphine, knowing that doing so will shorten life, but impermissible to administer a drug with the direct intention of terminating a patient's life (a bad effect). This latter claim is said to apply regardless of whether the injection is given at the person's request. This is not the appropriate forum to give full consideration to this doctrine, for which see entry on the doctrine of double effect. However, there is one very important criticism to be made of the application of the doctrine that has direct relevance to the issue of voluntary euthanasia.
On the most plausible reading, the doctrine of double effect can be relevant to the permissibility of voluntary euthanasia only when a person's death is bad for her or, to put it another way, a harm to her. Sometimes the notion of ‘harm’ is understood simply as damage to a person's interests whether consented to or not. At other times, it is understood, more strictly, as damage that has been wrongfully inflicted. On either understanding of harm, there can be instances in which death for a person does not constitute a harm for her because it will render her better off as compared with remaining alive. Accordingly, in those instances, the doctrine of double effect can have no relevance to the debate about the permissibility of voluntary euthanasia. (For extended discussions of the doctrine of double effect and its bearing on the moral permissibility of voluntary euthanasia see, e.g., McIntyre 2001; Woodward 2001; Cavanaugh 2006; Young 2007; Sumner 2011.)
Objection 4
There is a widespread belief that what is referred to as passive (voluntary) euthanasia, wherein life-sustaining or life-prolonging measures are withdrawn or withheld in response to a competent patient's request, is morally acceptable. The reason why passive (voluntary) euthanasia is said to be morally permissible is that steps are not taken to preserve or prolong life (and so the patient is simply allowed to die). This happens, for example, when a patient requests the withdrawal or the withholding of such measures because of advice that their administration would be medically futile. By contrast, active (voluntary) euthanasia is said to be morally impermissible because it requires an unjustifiable intentional act of killing in order to satisfy the patient's request (cf., for example, Finnis, 1995; Keown in Jackson and Keown 2012).
Despite its popularity and widespread use, the distinction between passive and active euthanasia is neither particularly clear nor morally helpful. (For a fuller discussion, see McMahan 2002.) Whether behavior is described in terms of acts or omissions (a distinction which underpins the alleged difference between active and passive voluntary euthanasia and that between killing a person and letting her die), is often a matter of pragmatics rather than anything of deeper moral importance. Consider, for instance, the practice (once common in hospitals) of deliberately proceeding slowly to a ward in response to a request to provide assistance for a patient who has been assigned a ‘not for resuscitation’ code. Or, consider ‘pulling the plug’ on a respirator keeping an otherwise dying patient alive as against not replacing the oxygen supply when it runs out. Are these acts or omissions? If the answers turn on merely pragmatic considerations the supposed distinction between passive euthanasia and active euthanasia will be hard to sustain.
Even supposing that the distinction between acts and omissions, and the associated distinction between killing and letting die, can be satisfactorily clarified, there remains the issue of whether these distinctions have moral significance in any particular circumstance. Consider the case of a patient suffering from motor neurone disease who is completely respirator dependent, finds her condition intolerable, and competently and persistently requests to be removed from the respirator so that she may die. Even the Catholic Church in recent times has been prepared to agree that it is permissible, in a case like this, to turn off the respirator. No doubt this has been because the Catholic Church considers such a patient is only allowed to die. Even if it is agreed, for the sake of argument, that such a death is an instance of letting die, this concession does not show that it would have been morally worse had the patient been killed at her request (active voluntary euthanasia) rather than being allowed to die (passive voluntary euthanasia). Indeed, many supporters of voluntary medically assisted death maintain that since death is beneficial in such an instance, actively bringing about the death is morally to be preferred to allowing it to happen (e.g., because the benefit is achieved sooner).
Opponents of voluntary euthanasia claim, however, that the difference between active and passive euthanasia is to be found in the agent's intention: if someone's life is intentionally terminated she has been killed, whereas if she is just no longer being aggressively treated, we can attribute her death to the underlying disease. Many physicians would say that their intention in withholding life-sustaining medical treatment in such circumstances is simply to respect the patient's wishes. This is plausible in those instances where the patient competently asks that aggressive treatment no longer be given (or the patient's proxy makes such a request). But it will often be implausible. In many cases the most plausible interpretation of a physician's intention in withdrawing life-sustaining measures is that it is to end the patient's life. Consider the palliative care practice of 'terminally sedating' a patient after a decision has been made to cease aggressive treatment. Suppose that this is then followed by withholding nutrition or withholding nutrition and hydration. In these latter instances the best explanation of the physician's behavior is that the physician intends thereby to end the life of the patient. What could be the point of the action, the goal aimed at, the intended outcome, if not to end the patient's life? (Cf. Winkler 1995.) No sense can be made of the action as being intended to palliate the patient's diseased condition, or to keep the patient comfortable. Nor is it appropriate to claim that what kills the patient is the underlying disease. What kills the patient is the act of starving her to death. The point can be generalized to cover many more instances involving either the withdrawal or the withholding of life-sustaining medical treatment. In short, there is no good reason to think that passive voluntary euthanasia can be morally acceptable whereas active voluntary euthanasia can never be.
But we can go further. Giving titrated doses of morphine that reach levels beyond what is needed to control pain, or removing a respirator from a sufferer from motor neurone disease seem to many to amount to intentionally bringing about the death of the person being cared for. To be sure, as was acknowledged above, there are circumstances in which doctors can truthfully say that the actions they perform, or omissions they make, will bring about the deaths of their patients even though it was not their intention that those patients would die. So, for instance, if a patient refuses life-prolonging medical treatment because she considers it futile, it can be reasonable to say that her doctor's intention in complying with the request was simply to respect her wishes. Nevertheless, as we have seen, there are other circumstances in which it is highly stilted to claim, as some doctors continue to do, that they had no intention of bringing about death.
These considerations would settle matters except that there are those who maintain that killing, in medical contexts, is always morally unjustified — a premise that underwrites much of the debate surrounding this fourth objection. But this underlying assumption is open to challenge and has been challenged by, e.g., Rachels 1986; Kuhse 1987; McMahan 2002. One of the reasons the challengers have given is that there are cases in which killing a competent dying person when she requests assistance with dying, is morally preferable to allowing her to die —, namely, when taking the latter option would serve only to prolong her suffering against her wishes. Further, despite the longstanding legal doctrine that no one can justifiably consent to be killed (on which more later), it surely is relevant to the justification of an act of killing that the person killed has autonomously decided that she would be better off dead and asks to be helped to die.
Objection 5
It is sometimes said that if society allows voluntary euthanasia to be legalized, we will then have set foot on a slippery slope that will lead us eventually to support other forms of euthanasia, including, in particular, non-voluntary euthanasia. Whereas it was once the common refrain that that was precisely what happened in Hitler's Germany, in recent decades the tendency has been to claim that experience with legalized euthanasia in The Netherlands has confirmed the reality of the slippery slope. Slippery slope arguments come in various versions. One (but not the only) way of classifying them has been to refer to logical, psychological and arbitrary line versions. The common feature of the different forms is the contention that once the first step is taken on a slippery slope the subsequent steps follow inexorably, whether for logical reasons, psychological reasons, or to avoid arbitrariness in ‘drawing a line’ between a person's actions. (For further discussion see, e.g., Rachels 1986; Brock 1992; Walton 1992.)
We need first to consider whether, at the theoretical level, any of these forms of argument is powerful enough to trouble an advocate of the legalization of voluntary euthanasia. We will then be in a position to comment on the alleged empirical support from the experiences of Hitler's Germany and, more recently, of legalized euthanasia in The Netherlands, for the existence of a slippery slope that will come into being with the legalization of voluntary euthanasia.
There is nothing logically inconsistent in supporting voluntary euthanasia while rejecting the moral inappropriateness of non-voluntary euthanasia. Some advocates of voluntary euthanasia, to be sure, wish also to lend their support to some acts of non-voluntary euthanasia, for example, for those in persistent vegetative states who have never indicated their wishes about being helped to die, or for certain severely disabled infants for whom the outlook is hopeless. (See, e.g., Singer 1994; Stingl 2010.) Others believe that the consent of the patient is strictly required if euthanasia is to be legalized. The difference is not a matter of logical acumen; it is to be explained by reference to the different values of the respective supporters. Thus, for example, those who insist on the necessity of honoring a competent patient's request for medical assistance with dying typically believe that a person's self-determination must be the paramount consideration in end-of-life decision making, whereas those who consider that a person's best interests should take precedence are apt to believe in the justifiability of instances of non-voluntary euthanasia like those mentioned above.
It is hard to see why moving from voluntary to non-voluntary euthanasia is supposed to be psychologically inevitable. Why should those who support the legalization of voluntary euthanasia, because they value the autonomy of the individual, find it psychologically easier, in consequence, to endorse the killing of those who are not able competently to request assistance with dying? What reason is there to believe that they will, as a result of their support for voluntary euthanasia, be psychologically driven to endorse a practice of non-voluntary euthanasia?
Finally, since there is nothing arbitrary about distinguishing voluntary euthanasia from non-voluntary euthanasia (because the line between them is based on clear principles), there can be no substance to the charge that only by arbitrarily drawing a line between them could non-voluntary euthanasia be avoided were voluntary euthanasia to be legalized.
What, though, of Hitler's Germany and the recent experience of legalized euthanasia in The Netherlands? The former is easily dismissed as an indication of an inevitable descent from voluntary euthanasia to non-voluntary. There never was a policy in favor of, or a legal practice of, voluntary euthanasia in Germany in the 1920s to the 1940s (see, for example, Burleigh 1994). There was, prior to Hitler coming to power, a clear practice of killing some disabled persons; but it was never suggested that their being killed was justified by reference to their best interests; rather, it was said that society would be benefited. Hitler's later revival of the practice and its widening to take in other groups such as Jews and gypsies was part of a program of eugenics, not euthanasia.
Since the publication of the Remmelink Report in 1991 into the medical practice of euthanasia in The Netherlands, it has frequently been said that the Dutch experience shows that legally protecting voluntary euthanasia is impossible without also affording shelter to the non-voluntary euthanasia that will follow in its train (see, e.g., Keown 2002). In the period since that report there have been a further four national studies of the practice of euthanasia in The Netherlands. These studies were carried out in 1995, 2001, 2005 and 2010 respectively (see, e.g., Rietjens, et al. 2009; Onwuteaka-Philipsen, et al. 2012). The findings from these national studies have consistently shown that there is no evidence for the existence of such a slippery slope. Among the specific findings the following are worth mentioning: of those terminally ill persons who have been assisted to die about sixty per cent have clearly been cases of voluntary euthanasia as it has been characterised in this entry; of the remainder, the vast majority of cases were of patients who at the time of their medically assisted deaths were no longer competent. It might be thought that these deaths ought to be regarded as instances of non-voluntary euthanasia. But, in fact, it would be inappropriate to regard them as such. Here is why. For the overwhelming majority of these cases, the decisions to end life were taken only after consultation between the attending doctor(s) and close family members, and so can legitimately be thought of as involving substituted judgements. Moreover, according to the researchers, the overwhelming majority of these cases fit within either of two common practices that occur in countries where voluntary euthanasia has not been legalized, namely, that of terminal sedation of dying patients, and that of giving large doses of opioids to relieve pain in the knowledge that this will also end life. In a very few cases, there was no consultation with relatives, though in those cases there were consultations with other medical personnel. The researchers contend that these instances are best explained by the fact that families in The Netherlands strictly have no final legal authority to act as surrogate decision-makers for incompetent persons. For these reasons the researchers maintain that non-voluntary euthanasia is not widely practised in The Netherlands.
That there have only been a handful of prosecutions of Dutch doctors for failing to follow agreed procedures (Griffiths, et al. 1998), that none of the doctors prosecuted has had a significant penalty imposed, and that the Dutch public have regularly reaffirmed their support for the agreed procedures suggests that, contrary to the claims of some critics, the legalization of voluntary euthanasia has not increased the incidence of non-voluntary euthanasia. A similar picture to the one in The Netherlands has emerged from studies of the operation of the law concerning physician-assisted suicide in Oregon. Unfortunately, there has been insufficient time for appropriate studies to be conducted in the other jurisdictions that have legalized either voluntary euthanasia or physician-assisted suicide. Finally, it has been argued by some that there may, in reality, be more danger of the line between voluntary and non-voluntary euthanasia being blurred if euthanasia is practised in the absence of legal recognition, since there will, in those circumstances, be no transparency or monitoring.
None of this is to suggest that it is not necessary to ensure the presence of safeguards against potential abuse of legally protected voluntary euthanasia. This is particularly important for the protection of those who have become incompetent by the time decisions need to be taken about whether to assist them to die. Furthermore, it is, of course, possible that the reform of any law may have unintended effects. However, if the arguments outlined above are sound (and the Dutch experience, along with the more limited experience in the State of Oregon, is not only the best evidence we have that they are sound, but the only relevant evidence), that does not seem very likely.
It is now well-established in many jurisdictions that competent patients are entitled to make their own decisions about life-sustaining medical treatment. That is why they can refuse such treatment even when doing so is tantamount to deciding to end their life. It is plausible to think that the fundamental basis of the right to decide about life-sustaining treatment — respect for a person's autonomy — has direct relevance to the legalization of voluntary euthanasia (see, e.g., Dworkin in Frey et al., 1998). In consequence, extending the right of self-determination to cover cases of voluntary euthanasia would not require a dramatic shift in legal policy. Nor would any novel legal values or principles need to be invoked. Indeed, the fact that suicide and attempted suicide are no longer criminal offences in many jurisdictions indicates that the central importance of individual self-determination in a closely analogous context has been accepted. The fact that assisted suicide and voluntary euthanasia have not yet been widely decriminalized is perhaps best explained along the lines that have frequently been offered for excluding the consent of the victim as a justification for an act of killing, namely the difficulties thought to exist in establishing the genuineness of the consent. But, the establishment of suitable procedures for giving consent to voluntary euthanasia and physician-assisted suicide would seem to be no harder than establishing procedures for competently refusing burdensome or otherwise unwanted medical treatment. The latter has already been accomplished in many jurisdictions, so the former should be achievable as well.
Suppose that the moral case for legalizing voluntary euthanasia does come to be judged as stronger than the case against legalization and voluntary euthanasia is made legally permissible in more jurisdictions than at present. Should doctors take part in the practice? Should only doctors perform voluntary euthanasia? These questions ought to be answered in light of the best understanding of what it is to provide medical care. The proper administration of medical care should promote the welfare of patients while respecting their individual self-determination. It is these twin values that should guide medical care, not the preservation of life at all costs, or the preservation of life without regard to whether patients want their lives prolonged should they judge that life is no longer of benefit or value to them. Many doctors in The Netherlands and, to judge from available survey evidence, in other liberal democracies as well, see the practice of voluntary euthanasia and physician-assisted suicide as not only compatible with their professional commitments but also with their conception of the best medical care for the dying. That being so, they should not be prohibited by law from lending their professional assistance to competent terminally ill persons who request assistance with dying because their suffering is irremediable or because their lives no longer have value for them.
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Other Internet Resources
- Medically Assisted Dying, authored by Robert Young (La Trobe University)
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