Notes to Pragmatist Feminism

1. Early in her career, Jane Addams rejected the possibility that a solution to a social issue could be developed by one group of people and applied to another.

We have learned to say that the good must be extended to all of society before it can be held secure by one person or one class; but we have not yet learned to add the statement that unless all men and classes contribute to that good, we cannot even be sure that it is worth having. (1902 [2002]: 97)

2. While their model emerges from and aligns with feminist pragmatist epistemology, uncovering this link can be challenging since the authors never reference the field. Instead, the authors acknowledge the influence of David Kolb, who attributes much of his work to John Dewey. Noted earlier, Dewey was heavily influenced by the work of feminist pragmatists but did not often acknowledge their contributions in his own work. Despite the difficulties involved in uncovering the history behind these practices, the alignment with and extension of feminist pragmatism is clear (Lake 2014).