Notes to Folk Psychology as Mental Simulation
1. More precisely, we shall adopt the following general rule to define “simulated mental state” in terms of “mental simulation of”:
(RULE) A token state M* is a simulated mental state if and only if there is another token state M such that: M* is a mental simulation of M.
For example, by applying RULE to RES-1, we obtain the following definition of “simulated mental state”:
(SIM) Token state M* is a simulated mental state if and only if:
- (1) M* resembles another token state, M, in some significant respects
- (2) Both M and M* are mental states
2. By applying RULE (see footnote 1) to RES+REU, we also obtain the following explicit definition of “simulated mental state”:
(SIM+) Token state M* is a simulated mental state if and only if:
- M* resembles another token state, M, in some significant respects
- Both M and M* are mental states
- M is generated by token cognitive process P
- M* is generated by token cognitive process P*
- P is implemented by the use of a token cognitive mechanism of type C
- P* is implemented by the reuse of a token cognitive mechanism of type C
Please notice that the relations among RES+REU, PROC, and SIM+ are such that:
- if there are mental states standing in the relation being a mental simulation of, then there are simulated mental states, and vice versa;
- if there are simulated mental states, then there are simulation processes, and vice versa;
- if there are mental states standing in the relation being a mental simulation of, then there are simulation processes, and vice versa.
For this reason, we shall often swiftly move from one category to the other. When there is no need to draw any fine-grained distinction among these different notions, we shall use the expression “mental simulation” as a generic umbrella term. In section 4, we shall also use the expression “mental simulation events” to pick out simulated mental states-or-simulation processes.
3. Moreover, both M* and P* are mental simulation events.
4. To be precise, it is instances of higher-level simulation processes that have features (a) and (b). However, in order to simplify the exposition, we shall put the token/type distinction aside.
