Derivation of the Law of Extensions

[Note: We use \(\epsilon F\) to denote the extension of the concept \(F\).]

We want to show, for an arbitrarily chosen concept P and an arbitrarily chosen object \(c\), that \(c\in\epsilon P\equiv Pc\).

\((\rightarrow)\) Assume \(c\in\epsilon P\) to show \(Pc)\). Then, by the definition of \(\in\), it follows that

\(\exists H(\epsilon P\eqclose \epsilon H \amp Hc)\)

Suppose that \(Q\) is such a property. Then, we know

\(\epsilon P\eqclose \epsilon Q \amp Qc\)

But, by Basic Law V, the first conjunct implies \(\forall x(Px\equiv Qx)\). So from the fact that \(Qc\), it follows that \(Pc\).

\((\leftarrow)\) Assume \(Pc\) (to show \(c\in\epsilon P)\). Then, by the Existence of Extensions principle, \(P\) has an extension, namely, \(\epsilon P\). So by the laws of identity, we know \(\epsilon P =\epsilon P\). We may conjoin this with our assumption to conclude

\(\epsilon P\eqclose \epsilon P\amp Pc\)

Now by existential generalizing on the concept \(P\), it follows that

\(\exists H(\epsilon P\eqclose \epsilon H \amp Hc)\)

Thus, by the definition of \(\in\), it follows that \(c\in\epsilon P\).