Derivation of the Principle of Extensionality from Basic Law V

[Note: We use \(\epsilon F\) to denote the extension of the concept \(F\).]

Assume Extension(x) and Extension(y). Then \(\exists F(x\eqclose \epsilon F)\) and \(\exists G(y\eqclose \epsilon G)\). Let \(P,Q\) be arbitrary such concepts; i.e., suppose \(x\eqclose \epsilon P\) and \(y \eqclose \epsilon Q\).

Now to complete the proof, assume \(\forall z(z\in x \equiv z\in y)\). It then follows that \(\forall z(z\in\epsilon P\equiv z\in\epsilon Q)\). So, by the Law of Extensions and the principles of predicate logic, we may convert both conditions in the universalized biconditional to establish that \(\forall z(Pz\equiv Qz)\). So by Basic Law V, \(\epsilon P =\epsilon Q\). So \(x = y\).