Notes to Friedrich Albert Lange

1. During his university years and later, Lange was very interested in gymnastics. He participated in tournaments, ran various organizations, and wrote about gymnastics. It should be emphasized that gymnastics in the German nineteenth-century context cannot be thought of merely as a hobby. Gymnastics organizations, indeed one can say the gymnastics movement as a whole, were part of an emphasis on physical fitness that was seen as going hand-in-hand with military preparedness in the face of French expansionism. It was part of a growing sense of nationalism and an unwillingness on the part of the growing middle classes to settle for the German Confederation created by the Congress of Vienna.

2. A Privatdozent is not part of the salaried staff of the University and is paid by student fees.

3. This at least is Ellissen's view. Weinkauff claims that the inaugural lecture was on Herbart's mathematical psychology (Weinkauff [1883] 1975, 24).

4. Helmholtz was a Professor of anatomy and physiology at the University of Bonn from 1855 to 1858.

5. This is probably to be explained by the fact that Marx and Engels had just been through what they regarded as a bad experience in trying to influence the workers' movement in Germany from afar by publishing in German newspapers. They felt that they had been mislead by the editor of the Social-Demokrat. Lange knew this but thought that their break with the Social-Demokrat actually opened up the possibility for new cooperation. Engel rejected the proposal politely with an allusion to recent problems and left the door for future cooperation open (Lange 1958, 73, 78-79; this includes Engels' letter). Engels was acting under Marx's instructions: “Lange: not to be directly rebuffed.…As he rightly realizes himself, after our recent experience we would have to hold back for the present from making contributions to any German paper” (Marx and Engels 1975, 42: 119). See also Hundt 1965, 698-99.

6. Arguably this particular stage of industrialization was at least better for the urban poor than their circumstances in the decades before the 1848 revolutions when they had flocked to the cities as the result of unemployment and hunger in rural areas.

7. Some of the material below is drawn from Hussain 2004.