Gregory of Rimini

First published Mon Sep 24, 2001; substantive revision Tue Sep 8, 2015

Gregory of Rimini may have been the last great scholastic theologian of the Middle Ages. He was the first thinker to incorporate substantially the developments of both the post-Ockham tradition at Oxford and the post-Auriol tradition at Paris, and his original synthesis had a long-lasting impact on European thought.

1. Life and Work

Biographical information for much of the life of Gregory of Rimini (a.k.a. de Arimino, Ariminensis, the “Torturer of Infants,” the Lucerna splendens, and the Doctor acutus or authenticus) derives from a letter of Pope Clement VI, dated 12 January 1345, requesting Gregory's promotion to Master of Theology at the University of Paris:

Gregory of Rimini, of the Order of the Friars Hermits of Saint Augustine, Parisian bachelor of theology, has now studied for twenty-two years, namely six straight years at Paris, and afterwards, returning to his native soil, he held the main chair at Bologna, Padua, and Perugia, and it has now been four years since he returned to Paris to lecture on the Sentences, lectures he has completed there commendably (Delucca 2003, 50).

According to the letter, then, Gregory first studied theology at Paris from 1322 or 1323 until 1328 or 1329. Working backwards, we can estimate that Gregory was born in Rimini around 1300, joined the mendicant order of the Hermits of Saint Augustine (OESA), and received his basic education before going to Paris. There he was exposed to the latest developments in philosophical theology, especially the ideas of the Franciscan Peter Auriol, who had died in early 1322. Assuming that the sequence in the papal letter is strictly chronological, Gregory then taught theology at various Augustinian studia in Italy, first at Bologna, where he is attested as lector in documents of late 1332, 1333, and early 1337. Perhaps he was transferred to Padua at the Augustinians' General Chapter meeting in Siena in 1338, and then he was shifted to Perugia. Almost certainly while he was in Italy, Gregory came into contact with the works of Oxford scholars from the 1320s and 1330s, most notably William of Ockham, Adam Wodeham, Richard Fitzralph, and Walter Chatton. Pope Clement's letter suggests that Gregory returned to Paris in late 1340 or in 1341 in order to lecture on the Sentences, but perhaps the “four years” refers to the date of his order's General Chapter of Montpellier, 1341, which may have been the occasion when Gregory was assigned to return to Paris. The prevailing view is that Gregory went to Paris in 1342 for a year of preparation for his lectures on the Sentences, which were given in 1343–44, but given that our records of these lectures were subject to revision, there is a degree of uncertainty. With help from the pope's letter, Gregory probably became Master of Theology in 1345, holding at least one quodlibetal disputation at Paris, but he continued to revise his written Sentences commentary until 1346, removing certain passages that were formerly considered later additiones. In late 1346 Master Gregory was in Rimini and the following year we find him teaching again in Padua, where he stayed until 1351 when the General Chapter at Basel sent him to teach at the recently established studium in Rimini. He remained there at least until late 1356, but on 20 May 1357, at the General Chapter in Montpellier, he was elected the Augustinians' prior general, succeeding the late Thomas of Strasbourg. Gregory died in Vienna toward the end of 1358 (see V. Marcolino's chapter in Oberman 1981, 127–94; Lambertini et al. 2002; Delucca 2003).

Gregory's most important writing by far is his commentary on the first two books of the Sentences. Book I survives in some twenty complete manuscripts, while there are about a dozen for book II. The work was printed several times from 1482 to 1532, reprinted in 1955, and finally received a modern critical edition in six volumes in 1979–84 (Rimini 1979–84; Bermon 2002). Parts have been or are being translated into French, German, and English. In addition to scriptural commentaries, Gregory was also responsible for smaller writings, including a work usually known as De usura, printed in 1508 and again in 1622 (see below, section 6). His tract on the intension and remission of forms, De intensione et remissione formarum corporalium, carries the incipit “Circa secundum partem huius distinctionis” and is, therefore, just an excerpt of the Sentences commentary, book I, distinction 17, part 2. Finally, from his brief term as his order's prior general we have his correspondence, which has been published (Rimini 1976).

2. Position in the History of Philosophy

Although Gregory of Rimini has received considerable attention from historians of medieval thought, understanding his position in the history of philosophy has been made difficult by several problems that have plagued the historiography of fourteenth-century scholasticism. He flourished at a time that has been judged by historians as on the whole decadent, fideistic, and radically skeptical, in contrast to the period in which, for example, Thomas Aquinas worked (d. 1274); this historical viewpoint already made difficult an objective evaluation of Rimini. Historians also labeled Gregory a “nominalist,” a term so broad and vague when applied to fourteenth-century thinkers that, when it was used without qualification, it tended to mislead and to obscure the differences among them, as for example between Ockham and Gregory. Finally, unlike Aquinas, Henry of Ghent, and John Duns Scotus, Gregory was active in a relatively understudied period, so that placing Gregory in his context is difficult and statements about Gregory's originality are precarious. The history of Gregory's own University of Paris in the quarter century before his Sentences lectures, in contrast to that of Oxford in the same years, is particularly unclear. Few scholars realize, moreover, that from the 1330s until the onset of the Great Schism in 1378, decades when the traditional leaders of European thought, the Franciscans and Dominicans, were in decline, Gregory was the leading light in an era in which his own Augustinian Order dominated, with such towering figures as Thomas of Strasbourg, Alphonsus Vargas of Toledo, and Hugolino of Orvieto, and a number of other important authors. Only careful diachronic studies of specific philosophical problems can provide a precise picture of Gregory's role in the history of philosophy, and few such studies have been accomplished thus far. There are some, however, and epistemology, foreknowledge, and predestination are examples of topics about which we know quite a bit (see below).

Generally, what has been learned so far is that Gregory was really the first to introduce to the University of Paris the exciting ideas developed at English schools between William of Ockham (ca. 1319) and Thomas Bradwardine (ca. 1344). Beginning with Gregory the names of Adam Wodeham, Richard Fitzralph, Walter Chatton, William Heytesbury, Thomas Buckingham, Richard Kilvington, Robert Halifax and others became common knowledge among Parisian scholars. Gregory was also deeply influenced by recent thinkers at his own university, both negatively and positively. The impact of Peter Auriol has long been recognized to be great, but recent studies have made clear that other figures, such as Francis of Marchia, Thomas of Strasbourg, Gerard Odonis, and Michael of Massa, had an influence on Gregory. The question of Gregory's relationship to his Parisian predecessors needs to be investigated more fully.

More clear is Gregory's importance in the late Middle Ages and Reformation, even if much of this period has received relatively little attention. Gregory's impact is obvious, because many scholastics after 1350 copied large passages from his works, including such prominent figures as the Cistercian James of Eltville, Pierre d'Ailly, and Henry of Langenstein. Other important thinkers, such as Hugolino of Orvieto OESA, the Cistercian Pierre Ceffons, Marsilius of Inghen, and Peter of Candia OFM (Pope Alexander V) knew Gregory's ideas well and cited them often. Few if any philosophers in the later fourteenth century can have been unaffected by his ideas, and for many he was their main inspiration. Gregory's impact both inside and outside the Augustinian Order continued into the fifteenth century. The common Sentences commentary (the so-called Quaestiones communes) of the University of Vienna in the first half of the century was largely based directly or indirectly on Gregory's thought, often duplicating his words. In the celebrated quarrel over future contingents at the University of Louvain (1465–1474), several of the participants cited Gregory's position or even adopted it without attribution. Of course, the fact that only books I and II of Gregory's commentary circulated means that Gregory's direct impact is to be found in topics discussed in those books rather than in issues covered in books III and IV, such as the Immaculate Conception and the Eucharist, which had their own philosophical sub-issues.

Perhaps the most central element of Gregory of Rimini's thought and influence is his adherence to Augustine and the nature of that adherence. For one thing, Gregory simply read Augustine more carefully and extensively than most previous thinkers, and so, for example, Gregory was able to attack Peter Auriol for his faulty citations and quotations of Augustine. Gregory's interest in the works of Augustine has been seen as central to the development of a “historico-critical” method in philosophical theology, especially in the Augustinian Order, partly foreshadowing modern scholarly methods. In connection with this historico-critical method, Gregory was part of a general attempt to establish reliable texts of Augustine and to separate authentic works from the pseudo-Augustinian corpus. Quotations from Augustine, moreover, were cited with great accuracy and detail in Gregory's writings, and so his Sentences commentary, when not plagiarized for his own ideas, was often used as a source for Augustinian quotations (Trapp 1956).

Not surprisingly, Gregory's ideas are often Augustinian. Gregory's brand of doctrinal Augustinianism, influenced rather by the Franciscan and Oxonian tradition than the more Dominican (and Parisian) variety of Giles of Rome, soon dominated the Augustinian Hermits' philosophy and theology. Thus by the early 16th century Aegidistae and Gregoriistae schools of thought existed, and a recognized via Gregorii was present in many universities such as Wittenberg, the university of Gregory's fellow Augustinian Hermit Martin Luther (McGrath 1987). The fact that Gregory's extreme Augustinian views on predestination became virtually official doctrine at the University of Vienna, and each book of his Sentences commentary was printed six times between 1482 and 1532, further helps explain why some of Gregory's ideas often resemble those of Luther and Jean Calvin. Gregory's thought had a life after the reformation, perhaps influencing Francisco Suarez, but certainly having an impact on seventeenth-century debates over such topics as predestination.

A list of Gregory's philosophical positions would perhaps not be difficult to make, and neither would it be hard to describe his relation to Ockham on various topics (e.g. Smith 1999). In natural philosophy, for example, in agreement with Ockham, Gregory was a nominalist and employed “Ockham's” razor in denying that sudden change, motion, and time are independent entities (Brown 1998b). Gregory also claims that the world could have been eternal, and that an actual infinite is possible (Maier 1949). But in these cases one would like to know better the stances of Gregory's immediate predecessors, especially Parisians like Francis of Marchia, in order to determine the possible sources and degree of originality of Gregory's ideas. (On the eternity of the world, for example, Gregory's view was not very strange in his day.) Otherwise, a list of Gregory's ideas is just that, a mere list. Consequently the focus here shall be on a few of the issues on which the theories of Gregory and his predecessors have been investigated in some depth.

3. Foreknowledge and Contingency

In many ways Gregory was a philosopher's theologian, because he began with propositions from Scripture as premises for his arguments and proceeded deductively. In his deductive theology, Gregory devoted much time and space to defining his terms and exploring exhaustively the implications of possible solutions, a practice that makes his Sentences commentary a joy to read and a philosophical classic. In distinctions 38–41 of book I, Gregory tackled the general problem of divine foreknowledge and future contingents and the specific dilemma of predestination and free will. Gregory's positions on these questions have already been the subject of study for many decades, and recently historians have attempted to put Gregory into his immediate Parisian and Oxonian context. Moreover, Gregory's nickname, “the Torturer of Infants,” stems in part from his stance on predestination. A discussion of Gregory's thought on these issues, therefore, provides a convenient introduction both to his noetic and to his position in history.

Gregory's treatment of divine foreknowledge and future contingents is aimed primarily at Peter Auriol and secondarily at Oxford theologians (Vignaux 1934, ch. 4; Hoenen 1993, 196–214; Schabel 2000, 264–274; Fiorentino 2004; Ciammetti 2011). In order to preserve the contingency of events stemming from human free will, Auriol claimed that propositions about future contingents are neither true nor false, but rather neutral, and so God does not know that the Antichrist will exist, since “the Antichrist will exist” is neither true nor false. Although like Ockham and Rimini later, Auriol maintained that exactly how God knows the future is incomprehensible to us, he did give a sophisticated explanation and defense of God's knowledge of our future. Gregory, however, chose to focus on the above-mentioned elements in Auriol's position. Gregory recognized that Auriol's theory of future-contingent propositions relies on Aristotle's stance in chapter 9 of On Interpretation. Interestingly, although Gregory denied the truth of the position itself, he nevertheless held that it was in fact Aristotle's. Indeed he rejected any attempt to interpret Aristotle differently, in the way that many medieval and modern philosophers have tried to do:

[This] is apparently a friendly excuse, but in truth it is more of an accusation, because the fact that absurdities ensue [from this position] does not convince us that [Aristotle] did not think that, but convinces us that he ought not to have thought that... Moreover, some modern theologians [i.e., Auriol], great teachers, said that the conclusion [denying determinate truth to future-contingent propositions] not only was the Philosopher's intention, but also that it is very true and even demonstrated... (Rimini 1979, 243).

So for Gregory, Auriol was correct that Aristotle denied the Principle of Bivalence when applied to propositions about future contingents.

Auriol set up two basic rules for such propositions: (1) if a proposition about the future, say, “Socrates will run,” is true, it is true immutably and inevitably, since no instant can be found when it would be false. (2) The significate of such a proposition will inevitably and necessarily be put into being. The foundation for Auriol's claim is his modal theory: immutability and necessity are the same thing. If something is immutable, it cannot be different from what it is, and so it necessarily is the way it is.

Gregory answered with a rigorous and lengthy defense of Bivalence and an alternative modal theory. His defense of Bivalence includes a detailed set of rules for propositions. It is significant that this section of Gregory's text, some seven pages, stems from Francis of Marchia's refutation of Auriol's position, a refutation adopted and extended by Gregory's own Augustinian predecessor at Paris, Michael of Massa. In short, Gregory argued that the Principle of Bivalence applies universally, and Aristotle was wrong to make an exception in the case of future-contingent propositions. Although this was his basic disagreement with Auriol, Gregory was so careful a philosopher that before he refuted Auriol on this point he corrected his Franciscan predecessor on details and in so doing made Auriol's own theory more precise.

Auriol placed greater emphasis on divine simplicity and necessity than on divine freedom and contingency when he was wrestling with one of the fundamental problems of Christian philosophical theology: given an absolutely simple and necessary God, what is the source of contingency? Auriol's own explanation lies in God's relationship with events in time, but this explanation was not of interest to Rimini, who was convinced by Scriptural prophecy that God does in fact know the future, and convinced by logic that the Principle of Bivalence holds universally. So the problem becomes, if God knows that Socrates will run, and the proposition “Socrates will run” is true, will not Socrates run necessarily?

Rimini's answer is a version of the opinio communis, a position with roots in Scotus and the Parisian tradition but which Ockham and later Oxford scholars refined with their focus on propositions. (It is possible that Ockham was influenced by Auriol in his concentration on future-contingent propositions, as some have held, but there is nothing specific to indicate that Ockham knew Auriol's treatment, and after Scotus it was natural for theologians to focus their attention on the truth of future-contingent propositions anyway.) The opinio communis relies on God's freedom to save contingency in the world: everything other than God is ultimately contingent, because God wills and acts freely and contingently in creating, and so it is logically possible for the things in the world not to have been or to have been otherwise. At the same time, the common position affirms God's immutability and determinate knowledge of such things. The upshot is that true propositions about future contingents have always been true and are immutably true, even determinately true, but that they are only contingently true and not necessarily so. So Gregory denies Auriol's equation of necessity and immutability.

Gregory's position relies on interesting uses of common logical devices and distinctions developed at Paris and Oxford over the preceding century, such as the distinction between the composite and divided senses of propositions, and that between conditional and absolute necessity. The purpose of these distinctions was to offer a way of explaining the contingency of events, but in doing so they assumed the ultimate contingency of everything except God. However, far from being an affirmation of the “radical contingency” of the world, as some historians have claimed, it was in fact the only way for most theologians to save at least some contingency from the threat of absolute logical and divine determinism. In fact, Gregory and others admitted that, assuming God's knowledge of the future, the future was necessary ex suppositione, although not absolutely, because it is logically possible for immutable God to know otherwise. Peter Auriol, and later Peter de Rivo, Pietro Pomponazzi, and Martin Luther, would consider these efforts feeble and deluded. The three Peters resorted to alternative theories that others considered equally feeble and deluded, whereas Luther simply accepted the conclusion that all attempts to save meaningful contingency governed by human free will were doomed to failure.

What is interesting about Gregory's treatment, again, is not his originality, but the clarity and precision with which he presented the common position. He even pointed out problems in the discussions of those with whom he broadly agreed, such as Ockham. True, almost all of what Rimini said could be found in Marchia, Massa, Ockham, Landulph Caracciolo, Adam Wodeham, and others, but not in such an organized fashion.

One final element of Gregory's stance on modal matters that deserves our attention is the contingency or necessity of the past. The opinio communis maintained that the past is somehow necessary in a strong sense, even though it is not absolutely necessary. It seems that Gregory did not go so far as to say that the past is necessary (beyond the normal necessity ex suppositione), but he does make some sort of modal distinction between the past and the future. Thus we can say that Gregory did not think God can change the past, although there has been some disagreement on this issue (Courtenay 1972–73; Schabel 2000, 271–2). Suffice it to say that the time has come for a long and careful treatment of the modal status of the past in medieval thought, to determine whether any thinker ever really thought the past could be changed. The probable answer is negative.

4. Predestination

Predestination was the traditional subject of distinctions 40–41 of commentaries on book I of the Sentences. This was a more purely “theological” subset of the more “philosophical” topic of foreknowledge and future contingents treated in distinctions 38–39. As in the case of foreknowledge, Gregory proceeded slowly and carefully, defining his terms and outlining the possible positions. Gregory's Augustinian bent shows through more clearly in predestination than in foreknowledge. Gregory quoted Augustine's words no less than 43 times in this context, and cited him still more often. Frequent scriptural quotations, carefully chosen, provide the ultimate basis for his theory. From Romans 9.13, where Paul comments on Malachi 1.2, “Jacob I have loved, but Esau I have hated,” Gregory took his position that from eternity, God actively elects to damn some and to save others, a theory called Double Predestination or Double Particular Election (Vignaux 1934, ch. 4; Schüler 1934; Halverson 1998, 143–157; Schabel 2002).

The main issue is what the causal connection is between humans' willing and acting and their salvation or damnation, and predestination or reprobation: do humans participate in or contribute to their own salvation and damnation, or is God's will the sole cause? Traditionally the answer had been that humans are the cause of their deserved damnation, but that salvation depended solely on God's will. Although there were various interpretations of this traditional stance, Peter Auriol seems to have been the first important university scholar to provide a real alternative. Auriol had already sought to distance God from the everyday details of the world's existence, in order to preserve divine necessity and the contingency of things. Auriol now applied his general theory to the specific issue of soteriology and claimed that God sets up general rules by which certain sets of people will be damned and other sets saved, without actively choosing to save or damn specific individuals. This maintained divine immutability but had the added bonus of providing symmetry for reprobation and predestination: the determining factor is the presence or absence of an obstacle to grace (obex gratiae). For Auriol, while someone's obstacle to grace is indeed a positive cause of reprobation, the absence of such an obstacle, however, is merely a negative or privative cause of predestination. Thus Auriol thought he could avoid charges of Pelagianism by simply denying a positive cause of predestination in the elect. Ockham appears to have adopted the main elements of Auriol's stance, while Walter Chatton at Oxford and Gerard Odonis and Thomas of Strasbourg at Paris went further and posited a positive cause of predestination in the elect, which would appear to approach the condemned Pelagian doctrine.

Gregory reacted by charging that both the theory of the privative cause and the notion of the positive cause of predestination in those who are predestined are Pelagian. Instead Gregory returned to the traditional view as it concerned predestination: it stems only from God's merciful will. However, Auriol's criticism of the asymmetry of the traditional position led Gregory to claim that not only do the predestined play no causal role in their salvation, but neither do the reprobate contribute to their damnation. In short, there is no reason either for one person's salvation or for another person's damnation except the inscrutable will of God: we do not know why some are saved and others damned. This, after all, Gregory believed, was the theory of Paul and of Augustine.

One has to admire Gregory's consistency here, mirroring that of his opponent, Peter Auriol. In the case of divine foreknowledge, Auriol provided an alternative to the traditional position because he claimed that the common defense of contingency failed. Auriol's theory allowed him to preserve the causal role of humans in reprobation, at the expense perhaps of involving humans in predestination and therefore coming close to Pelagianism. There were problems with Auriol's stance, but it was consistent. Gregory, on the other hand, agreed with the common position on divine foreknowledge, but when it really counted, in soteriology, Gregory took this common position to what he (and Auriol) thought was its logical conclusion. Since God's free creation and action is really the only source of contingency in the world, then God's free will is the only real cause of salvation and damnation. Salvation and damnation are contingent like anything else, but not contingent upon human free will, but merely on God's will. No doubt for Gregory, everyone else who held the opinio communis should also have held to Double Predestination or Double Particular Election. Indeed, at least one of Gregory's immediate predecessors, the Carmelite Guy Terrena, appears to have agreed (Schabel 2015). Luther and Calvin agreed with Gregory, but they saw no reason for the logical devices of the opinio communis, which for them as for Auriol could not save the contingency of human willing.

5. Cognition

Epistemology is another subject in which Gregory's thought has received much attention (e.g. Elie 1937; Dal Pra 1956; Gál 1977; Eckermann 1978; V. Wendland's chapter in Oberman 1981, 242–300; Tachau 1988, 358–71). As in natural philosophy, Gregory maintains a non-realist position that universals are formed by the soul and only after the mind has previous apprehensions of singular things. Thus sensory experience plays a major role in intellectual cognition. For simple cognition Gregory adopts the common terminology of the dichotomy between intuitive and abstractive cognition, although the difference between the two is based on the objects rather than the modes of cognition. For Gregory, intuitive cognition terminates immediately at the extramental object, but abstractive terminates at the object's species in the soul. Inspired by some of Ockham's successors, Gregory argues against the Venerable Inceptor's claim that via intuitive cognition one could determine whether a thing does not exist.

In agreement with Auriol against most contemporaries, however, Gregory also holds that one can have an intuitive cognition of an object that does not exist, as for example when we see a “broken” pencil in a glass of water, when there is only an unbroken pencil in reality. But Auriol is wrong in claiming that this is an instance of an intuitive cognition of something absent, because for Gregory the cognition is really caused by the species of some present object, although perhaps not the object that the mind thinks it is. Therefore Gregory does not adopt Auriol's definition of intuitive cognition as the cognition when the soul merely thinks that the object is present. In any case the dichotomy is different for Gregory because he maintains that abstractive cognition is also somewhat intuitive, since the species of the object is known immediately and therefore intuitively.

In the course of Gregory's long discussion of the problem of foreknowledge and future contingents, he makes frequent reference to the notion of the complexe significabile. When it comes to complex cognition, or scientific knowledge, Gregory's inspiration was Adam Wodeham, who built on some of Walter Chatton's ideas in developing the complexe significabile. Ockham held that the object of scientific knowledge is the conclusion of a syllogism, and Gregory rejects this. Chatton's alternative was that scientific knowledge has as its object things outside the mind. Gregory also denies this, because

if this were the case, many sciences would be about contingent things that could be different than they are, whereas for strict science the object must be eternal and necessary. Every being, however, besides God is contingent and not necessary. If things outside the mind were the objects of the sciences, then many sciences, physical and geometrical, and many others, would be about things other than God, and therefore about contingent things (Rimini 1979, 6; Brown 1998a, 171).

One can see here how Gregory's stress on the overarching contingency of creation connects with his epistemology.

Gregory chooses as the object of scientific knowledge the alternative offered by Adam Wodeham. Chatton's notion of “thing” in scientific knowledge was the state of affairs signified by both the negative and the affirmative proposition. For example, “Socrates is sitting” and “Socrates is not sitting” signify for Chatton the same thing, not Socrates, not sitting, and not the propositions, but somehow the whole Socrates's-being-seated. Although Chatton had his reasons for his theory, Wodeham modified it in a useful way, differentiating between positive and negative states of affairs. Thus for Wodeham, each proposition has its own total significate that is only complexly signifiable (complexe significabile), so that Socrates's-being-seated and Socrates's-not-being-seated are two different things, the objects of scientific knowledge.

Gregory adopted Wodeham's theory and tailored it where necessary to his own thought. The complexe significabile, once thought to be Gregory's invention, is neither the proposition itself (although it determines the truth or falsity of the proposition) nor individual things in the world, but rather the arrangement of things in the world. He differed from Wodeham, for example, in the way he thought about “assenting to” and “dissenting from” such complexe significabilia, an issue which had occupied Chatton at length. Gregory then applied the notion to a host of other philosophical problems, such as future contingents, and through him the complexe significabile became the common intellectual property of continental thinkers, and parallel notions are found in many important later intellectuals.

6. Economic Thought

Although his commentary on books I and II of the Sentences is by far Gregory's largest and most important work, historians of medieval philosophy have recently devoted some attention to his sole writing on economic thought, which was printed in Reggio Emilia in 1508 as the Tractatus de imprestantiis Venetorum et de usura and reprinted in Rimini itself over a century later in 1622 (Rimini 1508; Lambertini 2003, 2009; Kirshner 2015). The only known manuscript witness is in a codex containing various political and economic tracts: Florence, Biblioteca Nazionale Centrale, Conv. Soppr. J. X. 51, ff. 201r-212r. The manuscript carries a different redaction of the text, but it can be used to correct the printed editions and should form the basis of a future critical edition. The title and explicit in the manuscript further identify the work as a quaestio disputata on the forced loans of the Venetian commune according to the determination of Gregory of Rimini, Master of Theology and prior general of the Augustinians. Terminology in the text itself confirms that rather than a purely written work, the piece derives from an oral disputation, although the internal structure and the existence of two redactions indicate that it was much revised afterwards. Since we know that theologians’ administrative responsibilities did not preclude their participation in such events as quodlibetal disputations, it is possible that the debate took place while Gregory was his order's prior general as the incipit says, i.e., in the latter half of 1357 or in 1358, which would make it his last word on intellectual matters.

Gregory was actually asked two questions, and he combined them in his determination. The first was whether it was licit for a creditor to receive interest on a forced loan. Various Italian communes resorted to forced loans from their citizens to raise money, paying in return an annual sum but never the principal. In the case of Venice, the forced lender received 5%. The second question asked whether it was licit for someone else to acquire the title to the loan from the forced lender, for a sum smaller than the initial loan, and continue to receive the annual sum from the commune. For example, the government could demand $100 from a citizen, promising to pay $5 each year. Another citizen could then pay $25 to the first citizen and acquire the right to receive the annual payment of $5.

The issue was a concrete one in the fourteenth century, and several scholars were asked similar or even identical questions, which allows us to place Gregory's determination in a historical context. One writer gave a liberal response to the first question, that the mere fact that the loan was forced made the creditor's receiving of 5% interest licit, while the same author considered the second transaction an acceptable contract of sale and not a purchase of a loan. A more conservative author, on the other hand, viewed the 5% as usury, unless it constituted a spontaneous gift from the commune to the citizen and as long as the citizen did not intend to profit. In this case, the gift could not be purchased licitly by another, naturally, for the unforced buyer would surely be a usurer.

Gregory's treatment has been singled out as historically significant. Gregory's procedure reflects his earlier Sentences commentary in his careful structure. Following opening arguments, Gregory divides the determination into four articles, first defining his terms, second discussing the sinfulness of usury, third answering the questions, and fourth responding to the opening arguments. Although Gregory is a Master of Theology, he answers the question as a philosopher, employing rational arguments. For Gregory, usury is wrong pure and simple, since it breaks the rule of equality in exchanges. One might view this as a conservative approach, but Gregory's general position may entail a liberal implementation of his theory, since the determining factor lies in one's conscience, in one's intent: “Usury is profit intended from a loan.” Gregory's emphasis on the role of intent and conscience here is unusual. In the case at hand, Venice can legitimately pay the 5% only if the commune's motives are honorable, either because it believes it is paying for damages or returning a kindness, although Gregory excludes from the rubric “damages” the opportunity costs from the resulting non-acquisition of possible profits, thus further demonstrating his awareness of business and banking practices. Since Venice pays all forced creditors such a regular annual fee, however, it does not seem to Gregory to be paid for either of those reasons. Still, he leaves it up to the conscience.

This applies to the second question as well. The creditor who has given the loan in good conscience and without hope of profit has not committed usury, so he has “a right over the commune” that he can sell licitly. Moreover, the buyer can purchase this licitly, as long as he does not intend to profit thereby. But if this is not the case, if profit is intended, the sin of usury is committed, more seriously than in the first case, since no force is involved.

Gregory's determination would allow Venice and its creditors to proceed with their practice of forced loans and creditors’ transfers of annual payments without outward restrictions from the Church. Perhaps he was being practical given the complexities of the situation. By stressing the role of intent and conscience, he freed investors to pursue their projects. But without drawing clear lines separating the legitimate from the illegitimate, he burdened them to consider their motives in each and every transaction, warning that whether they are usurers in truth will be determined before God at the judgment of souls.

7. Conclusion

Now that Gregory's works are available in a reliable modern edition, he has begun receiving more direct attention, for example in the collection of papers in Oberman 1981 and in the conference held in Rimini in 2000 that was devoted to Gregory's life and thought (published as Gregorio da Rimini. Filosofo in Rimini in 2003). It is to be hoped that further studies of his Parisian and Oxford predecessors on various single issues will enable us to see his innovations more clearly. Recent studies have shown that he was not always as original as was once thought, but that does not diminish in any way his important position in the history of philosophy. Moreover, Gregory sometimes did come up with new solutions to problems, and even where he did not, his treatments, because of their clarity and comprehensiveness, often became the primary source for later thinkers of the ideas he adopted from his predecessors and developed.

Bibliography

Primary Sources

  • Rimini, Tractatus de impresantiis Venetorum et de usura, Reggio Emilia: Ludovicus de Mazalis 1508; Rimini 1622.
  • Rimini, Gregorii de Arimino OSA Registrum Generalatus 1357–1358, A. Maijer (ed.), Rome: Institutum Historicum Augustinianum 1976.
  • Rimini, Gregorii Ariminensis Lectura super primum et secundum Sententiarum, 6 vols. (= Spätmittelalter und Reformation Texte und Untersuchungen 6–11), D. Trapp, V. Marcolino, W. Eckermann, M. Santos-Noya. W. Schulze, W. Simon, W. Urban, and V. Vendland (eds.), Berlin/New York: De Gruyter 1979–84.

Secondary Works

Note: The bibliography below is necessarily limited, given the large number of studies related to Gregory of Rimini's thought.
  • Bermon, P. (2002): “La Lectura sur les deux premiers livres des Sentences de Grégoire de Rimini O.E.S.A. (1300–1358),” in G.R. Evans (ed.), Medieval Commentaries on Peter Lombard's Sentences, vol. 1, Leiden: Brill, 267–85.
  • ––– (2007): L'assentiment et son objet chez Grégoire de Rimini, Paris: Vrin.
  • Brinzei, M., and C. Schabel (2015): “The Past, Present, and Future of Late-Medieval Theology: The Commentary on the Sentences of Nicholas of Dinkelsbühl, Vienna, ca. 1400.” in P.W. Rosemann, ed., Mediaeval Commentaries on the Sentences of Peter Lombard, vol. III, Leiden: Brill, 174–266.
  • Brown, S.F. (1998a): “Gregory of Rimini (c. 1300–1358),” Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy, X: 170a-72b.
  • ––– (1998b): “Walter Burley, Peter Aureoli, and Gregory of Rimini,” in J. Marenbon, ed., Medieval Philosophy (= Routledge History of Philosophy III), London: Routledge, 368–85.
  • Ciammetti, D. (2011): Necessità e contingenza in Gregorio da Rimini, Pisa: Edizioni ETS.
  • Conti, A., R. Lambertini, and A. Tabarroni (2002): “Gregorio da Rimini,” in Dizionario Biografico degli italiani, 59: 277–8.
  • Courtenay, W.J. (1972–73): “John of Mirecourt and Gregory of Rimini on Whether God Can Undo the Past,” Recherches de Théologie ancienne et médiévale 39 (1972): 224–53, and 40 (1973): 147–74.
  • ––– (1978): Adam Wodeham: An Introduction to His Life and Writings (= Studies in Medieval and Reformation Thought 21), Leiden: Brill.
  • Cross, R. (1998): “Infinity, Continuity, and Composition: The Contribution of Gregory of Rimini,” Medieval Philosophy and Theology, 7: 89–110.
  • Dal Pra, M. (1956): “La teoria del ‘significato totale’ della proposizione nel pensiero di Gregorio da Rimini,” Rivista critica di storia della filosofia, 11: 287–311.
  • Delucca, O. (2003), “Gregorio da Rimini: Cenni biografici e documentari,” in Gregorio da Rimini filosofo (Atti del Convengo – Rimini, 25 novembre 2000) (Rimini 2003), 45–65.
  • Eckermann, W. (1978): Wort und Wirklichkeit: Das Sprachverständnis in der Theologie Gregors von Rimini und Sein Weiterwirken in der Augustinerschule (= Cassiciacum 33), Würzburg: Augustinus.
  • Elie, H. (1937): Le complexe significabile, Paris: Vrin.
  • Fiorentino, F. (2004): Gregorio da Rimini. Contingenza, futuro e scienza nel pensiero tardo-medievale, Rome: Antonianum.
  • Friedman, R.L. (2013): Intellectual Traditions at the Medieval University. The Use of Philosophical Psychology in Trinitarian Theology among the Franciscans and Dominicans, 1250–1350, 2 vols. (= Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters 108), Leiden: Brill.
  • Gál, G. (1977): “Adam Wodeham's Question on the complexe significabile as the Immediate Object of Scientific Knowledge,” Franciscan Studies, 37: 66–102.
  • García Lescún, E. (1970): La teología trinitaria de Gregorio de Rimini: Contribución a la historia de la escolástica tardía, Burgos: Ediciones Aldecos.
  • Halverson, J. (1998): Peter Aureol on Predestination: A Challenge to Late Medieval Thought (= Studies in the History of Christian Thought 83), Leiden: Brill.
  • Hoenen, M.J.F.M. (1993): Marsilius of Inghen: Divine Knowledge in Late Medieval Thought (= Studies in the History of Christian Thought 50), Leiden: Brill.
  • Kirshner, J. (2015): “Authority, Reason, and Conscience in Gregory' of Rimini's Questio prestitorum communis Venetiarum,” in P. Schulte and P. Hesse, eds., Reichtum im späten Mittelalter. Politische Theorie – Ethische Norm – Soziale Akzeptanz, Stuttgart: Franz Steiner, 115–43.
  • Lambertini, R. (2003): “L'economia e la sua etica: la 'quaestio' di Gregorio da Rimini su debito ed usura,” in Gregorio da Rimini. Filosofo (Atti del Convengo – Rimini, 25 novembre 2000), Rimini 2003, 97–126.
  • ––– (2009): Il dibattito medievale sul consolidamento del debito pubblico dei comuni. L'intervento del teologo Gregorio da Rimini (†1358), Milano: Associazione per lo Sviluppo degli Studi di Banca e di Borsa.
  • Leff, G. (1961): Gregory of Rimini: Tradition and Innovation in Fourteenth Century Thought, New York: Manchester.
  • Maier, A (1949): Die Vorläufer Galileis im 14. Jahrhundert, Rome: Edizioni di storia e letteratura.
  • McGrath, A.E. (1987): Intellectual Origins of the Reformation, Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Oberman, H.A., ed. (1981): Gregor von Rimini: Werk und Wirkung bis zur Reformation, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Santos-Noya, M. (1990): Die Sünden und Gnadenlehre des Gregors von Rimini, Frankfurt: P. Lang.
  • Schabel, C. (2000): Theology at Paris 1316–1345: Peter Auriol and the Problem of Divine Foreknowledge and Future Contingents (= Ashgate Studies in Medieval Philosophy 1), Aldershot: Ashgate.
  • ––– (2002): “Parisian Commentaries from Peter Auriol to Gregory of Rimini, and the Problem of Predestination,” in G.R. Evans, ed., Medieval Commentaries on Peter Lombard's Sentences, vol. I, Leiden: Brill, 221–65.
  • ––– (2015): “Guiu Terrena on Predestination in His Commentary on Gratian's Decretum,” in A. Fidora (ed.), Guido Terreni, O. Carm. (†1342): Studies and Texts (= Textes et études du Moyen Age, 78), Barcelona/Madrid: FIDEM, 83–105 and 325–388.
  • Schüler, M. (1934): Prädestination, Sünde und Freiheit bei Gregor von Rimini, Stuttgart: Kohlhammer.
  • Smith, K. (1999): “Ockham's Influence on Gregory of Rimini's Natural Philosophy,” in V. Syros, A. Kouris, and H. Kalokairinou, eds., Dialexeis: Akademaiko etos 1996–7, Nicosia: Homilos Philosophias Panepistemiou Kyprou, 107–42.
  • Tachau, K.H., (1988): Vision and Certitude in the Age of Ockham: Optics, Epistemology and the Foundations of Semantics, 1250–1345 (= Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters 22), Leiden: Brill.
  • Trapp, D. (1956): “Augustinian Theology of the 14th Century: Notes on Editions, Marginalia, Opinions and Book-Lore,” Augustiniana, 6: 146–241.
  • Vignaux, P. (1934): Justification et Prédestination au XIVe siècle: Duns Scot, Pierre d'Aureole, Guillaume d'Occam, Grégoire de Rimini, Paris: Leroux.
  • Würsdörfer, J. (1917): Erkennen und Wissen bei Gregor von Rimini, Münster i. W.: Aschendorff.

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Christopher Schabel <schabel@ucy.ac.cy>

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