Philosophy of Humor

First published Tue Nov 20, 2012; substantive revision Wed Sep 28, 2016

Although most people value humor, philosophers have said little about it, and what they have said is largely critical. Three traditional theories of laughter and humor are examined, along with the theory that humor evolved from mock-aggressive play in apes. Understanding humor as play helps counter the traditional objections to it and reveals some of its benefits, including those it shares with philosophy itself.

1. Humor’s Bad Reputation

When people are asked what’s important in their lives, they often mention humor. Couples listing the traits they prize in their spouses usually put “sense of humor” at or near the top. Philosophers are concerned with what is important in life, so two things are surprising about what they have said about humor.

The first is how little they have said. From ancient times to the 20th century, the most that any notable philosopher wrote about laughter or humor was an essay, and only a few lesser-known thinkers such as Frances Hutcheson and James Beattie wrote that much. The word humor was not used in its current sense of funniness until the 18th century, we should note, and so traditional discussions were about laughter or comedy. The most that major philosophers like Plato, Hobbes, and Kant wrote about laughter or humor was a few paragraphs within a discussion of another topic. Henri Bergson’s 1900 Laughter was the first book by a notable philosopher on humor. Martian anthropologists comparing the amount of philosophical writing on humor with what has been written on, say, justice, or even on Rawls’ Veil of Ignorance, might well conclude that humor could be left out of human life without much loss.

The second surprising thing is how negative most philosophers have been in their assessments of humor. From ancient Greece until the 20th century, the vast majority of philosophical comments on laughter and humor focused on scornful or mocking laughter, or on laughter that overpowers people, rather than on comedy, wit, or joking. Plato, the most influential critic of laughter, treated it as an emotion that overrides rational self-control. In the Republic (388e), he says that the Guardians of the state should avoid laughter, “for ordinarily when one abandons himself to violent laughter, his condition provokes a violent reaction.” Especially disturbing to Plato were the passages in the Iliad and the Odyssey where Mount Olympus was said to ring with the laughter of the gods. He protested that “if anyone represents men of worth as overpowered by laughter we must not accept it, much less if gods.”

Another of Plato’s objections to laughter is that it is malicious. In Philebus (48–50), he analyzes the enjoyment of comedy as a form of scorn. “Taken generally,” he says, “the ridiculous is a certain kind of evil, specifically a vice.” That vice is self-ignorance: the people we laugh at imagine themselves to be wealthier, better looking, or more virtuous than they really are. In laughing at them, we take delight in something evil—their self-ignorance—and that malice is morally objectionable.

Because of these objections to laughter and humor, Plato says that in the ideal state, comedy should be tightly controlled. “We shall enjoin that such representations be left to slaves or hired aliens, and that they receive no serious consideration whatsoever. No free person, whether woman or man, shall be found taking lessons in them.” “No composer of comedy, iambic or lyric verse shall be permitted to hold any citizen up to laughter, by word or gesture, with passion or otherwise” (Laws, 7: 816e; 11: 935e).

Greek thinkers after Plato had similarly negative comments about laughter and humor. Though Aristotle considered wit a valuable part of conversation (Nicomachean Ethics 4, 8), he agreed with Plato that laughter expresses scorn. Wit, he says in the Rhetoric (2, 12), is educated insolence. In the Nicomachean Ethics (4, 8) he warns that “Most people enjoy amusement and jesting more than they should … a jest is a kind of mockery, and lawgivers forbid some kinds of mockery—perhaps they ought to have forbidden some kinds of jesting.” The Stoics, with their emphasis on self-control, agreed with Plato that laughter diminishes self-control. Epictetus’s Enchiridion (33) advises “Let not your laughter be loud, frequent, or unrestrained.” His followers said that he never laughed at all.

These objections to laughter and humor influenced early Christian thinkers, and through them later European culture. They were reinforced by negative representations of laughter and humor in the Bible, the vast majority of which are linked to hostility. The only way God is described as laughing in the Bible is with hostility:

The kings of the earth stand ready, and the rulers conspire together against the Lord and his anointed king… . The Lord who sits enthroned in heaven laughs them to scorn; then he rebukes them in anger, he threatens them in his wrath (Psalm 2:2–5).

God’s spokesmen in the Bible are the Prophets, and for them, too, laughter expresses hostility. In the contest between God’s prophet Elijah and the 450 prophets of Baal, for example, Elijah ridicules them for their god’s powerlessness, and then has them slain (1 Kings 18:21–27). In the Bible, mockery is so offensive that it may deserve death, as when a group of children laugh at the prophet Elisha for his baldness:

He went up from there to Bethel and, as he was on his way, some small boys came out of the city and jeered at him, saying, “Get along with you, bald head, get along.” He turned round and looked at them and he cursed then in the name of the Lord; and two she-bears came out of a wood and mauled forty-two of them (2 Kings 2:23).”

Bringing together negative assessments of laughter from the Bible with criticisms from Greek philosophy, early Christian leaders such as Ambrose, Jerome, Basil, Ephraim, and John Chrysostom warned against either excessive laughter or laughter generally. Sometimes what they criticized was laughter in which the person loses self-control. In his Long Rules, for instance, Basil the Great wrote that “raucous laughter and uncontrollable shaking of the body are not indications of a well-regulated soul, or of personal dignity, or self-mastery” (in Wagner 1962, 271). Other times they linked laughter with idleness, irresponsibility, lust, or anger. John Chrysostom, for example, warned that

Laughter often gives birth to foul discourse, and foul discourse to actions still more foul. Often from words and laughter proceed railing and insult; and from railing and insult, blows and wounds; and from blows and wounds, slaughter and murder. If, then, you would take good counsel for yourself, avoid not merely foul words and foul deeds, or blows and wounds and murders, but unseasonable laughter itself (in Schaff 1889, 442).

Not surprisingly, the Christian institution that most emphasized self-control—the monastery—was harsh in condemning laughter. One of the earliest monastic orders, of Pachom of Egypt, forbade joking (Adkin 1985, 151–152). The Rule of St. Benedict, the most influential monastic code, advised monks to “prefer moderation in speech and speak no foolish chatter, nothing just to provoke laughter; do not love immoderate or boisterous laughter.” In Benedict’s Ladder of Humility, Step Ten is a restraint against laughter, and Step Eleven a warning against joking (Gilhus 1997, 65). The monastery of St. Columbanus Hibernus had these punishments: “He who smiles in the service … six strokes; if he breaks out in the noise of laughter, a special fast unless it has happened pardonably” (Resnick 1987, 95).

The Christian European rejection of laughter and humor continued through the Middle Ages, and whatever the Reformers reformed, it did not include the traditional assessment of humor. Among the strongest condemnations came from the Puritans, who wrote tracts against laughter and comedy. One by William Prynne (1633) encouraged Christians to live sober, serious lives. Christians should not be “immoderately tickled with mere lascivious vanities,” Prynne wrote, or “lash out in excessive cachinnations in the public view of dissolute graceless persons.” When the Puritans came to rule England in the mid-17th century, they outlawed comedies.

At this time, too, the philosophical case against laughter was strengthened by Thomas Hobbes and René Descartes. Hobbes’ Leviathan (1651 [1982]) describes human beings as naturally individualistic and competitive. That makes us alert to signs that we are winning or losing. The former make us feel good and the latter bad. If our perception of some sign that we are superior comes over us quickly, our good feelings are likely to issue in laughter. In Part I, ch. 6, he writes that

Sudden glory, is the passion which makes those grimaces called laughter; and is caused either by some sudden act of their own, that pleases them; or by the apprehension of some deformed thing in another, by comparison whereof they suddenly applaud themselves. And it is incident most to them, that are conscious of the fewest abilities in themselves; who are forced to keep themselves in their own favor by observing the imperfections of other men. And therefore much laughter at the defects of others, is a sign of pusillanimity. For of great minds, one of the proper works is, to help and free others from scorn; and to compare themselves only with the most able.

A similar explanation of laughter from the same time is found in Descartes’ Passions of the Soul. He says that laughter accompanies three of the six basic emotions—wonder, love, (mild) hatred, desire, joy, and sadness. Although admitting that there are other causes of laughter than hatred, in Part 3 of this book, “Of Particular Passions,” he considers laughter only as an expression of scorn and ridicule.

Derision or scorn is a sort of joy mingled with hatred, which proceeds from our perceiving some small evil in a person whom we consider to be deserving of it; we have hatred for this evil, we have joy in seeing it in him who is deserving of it; and when that comes upon us unexpectedly, the surprise of wonder is the cause of our bursting into laughter… And we notice that people with very obvious defects such as those who are lame, blind of an eye, hunched-backed, or who have received some public insult, are specially given to mockery; for, desiring to see all others held in as low estimation as themselves, they are truly rejoiced at the evils that befall them, and they hold them deserving of these (art. 178–179).

2. The Superiority Theory

With these comments of Hobbes and Descartes, we have a sketchy psychological theory articulating the view of laughter that started in Plato and the Bible and dominated Western thinking about laughter for two millennia. In the 20th century, this idea was called the Superiority Theory. Simply put, our laughter expresses feelings of superiority over other people or over a former state of ourselves. A contemporary proponent of this theory is Roger Scruton, who analyses amusement as an “attentive demolition” of a person or something connected with a person. “If people dislike being laughed at,” Scruton says, “it is surely because laughter devalues its object in the subject’s eyes” (in Morreall 1987, 168).

In the 18th century, the dominance of the Superiority Theory began to weaken when Francis Hutcheson (1750) wrote a critique of Hobbes’ account of laughter. Feelings of superiority, Hutcheson argued, are neither necessary nor sufficient for laughter. In laughing, we may not be comparing ourselves with anyone, as when we laugh at odd figures of speech like those in this poem about a sunrise:

The sun, long since, had in the lap
Of Thetis taken out his nap;
And like a lobster boil’d, the morn
From black to red began to turn.

If self-comparison and sudden glory are not necessary for laughter, neither are they sufficient for laughter. Hutcheson says that we can feel superior to lower animals without laughing, and that “some ingenuity in dogs and monkeys, which comes near to some of our own arts, very often makes us merry; whereas their duller actions in which they are much below us, are no matter of jest at all.” He also cites cases of pity. A gentleman riding in a coach who sees ragged beggars in the street, for example, will feel that he is better off than they, but such feelings are unlikely to amuse him. In such situations, “we are in greater danger of weeping than laughing.”

To these counterexamples to the Superiority Theory we could add more. Sometimes we laugh when a comic character shows surprising skills that we lack. In the silent movies of Charlie Chaplin, Harold Lloyd, and Buster Keaton, the hero is often trapped in a situation where he looks doomed. But then he escapes with a clever acrobatic stunt that we would not have thought of, much less been able to perform. Laughing at such scenes does not seem to require that we compare ourselves with the hero; and if we do make such a comparison, we do not find ourselves superior.

At least some people, too, laugh at themselves—not a former state of themselves, but what is happening now. If I search high and low for my eyeglasses only to find them on my head, the Superiority Theory seems unable to explain my laughter at myself.

While these examples involve persons with whom we might compare ourselves, there are other cases of laughter where no personal comparisons seem involved. In experiments by Lambert Deckers (1993), subjects were asked to lift a series of apparently identical weights. The first several weights turned out to be identical, and that strengthened the expectation that the remaining weights would be the same. But then subjects picked up a weight that was much heavier or lighter than the others. Most laughed, but apparently not out of Hobbesian “sudden glory,” and apparently without comparing themselves with anyone.

3. The Relief Theory

Further weakening the dominance of the Superiority Theory in the 18th century were two new accounts of laughter which are now called the Relief Theory and the Incongruity Theory. Neither even mentions feelings of superiority.

The Relief Theory is an hydraulic explanation in which laughter does in the nervous system what a pressure-relief valve does in a steam boiler. The theory was sketched in Lord Shaftesbury’s 1709 essay “An Essay on the Freedom of Wit and Humor,” the first publication in which humor is used in its modern sense of funniness. Scientists at the time knew that nerves connect the brain with the sense organs and muscles, but they thought that nerves carried “animal spirits”—gases and liquids such as air and blood. John Locke (1690, Book 3, ch. 9, para.16), for instance, describes animal spirits as “fluid and subtile Matter, passing through the Conduits of the Nerves.”

Shaftesbury’s explanation of laughter is that it releases animal spirits that have built up pressure inside the nerves.

The natural free spirits of ingenious men, if imprisoned or controlled, will find out other ways of motion to relieve themselves in their constraint; and whether it be in burlesque, mimicry, or buffoonery, they will be glad at any rate to vent themselves, and be revenged upon their constrainers.

Over the next two centuries, as the nervous system came to be better understood, thinkers such as Herbert Spencer and Sigmund Freud revised the biology behind the Relief Theory but kept the idea that laughter relieves pent-up nervous energy.

Spencer’s explanation in his essay “On the Physiology of Laughter” (1911) is based on the idea that emotions take the physical form of nervous energy. Nervous energy, he says, “always tends to beget muscular motion, and when it rises to a certain intensity, always does beget it” (299). “Feeling passing a certain pitch habitually vents itself in bodily action” (302). When we are angry, for example, nervous energy produces small aggressive movements such as clenching our fists; and if the energy reaches a certain level, we attack the offending person. In fear, the energy produces small-scale movements in preparation for fleeing; and if the fear gets strong enough, we flee. The movements associated with emotions, then, discharge or release the built-up nervous energy.

Laughter releases nervous energy, too, Spencer says, but with this important difference: the muscular movements in laughter are not the early stages of larger practical actions such as attacking or fleeing. Unlike emotions, laughter does not involve the motivation to do anything. The movements of laughter, Spencer says, “have no object” (303): they are merely a release of nervous energy.

The nervous energy relieved through laughter, according to Spencer, is the energy of emotions that have been found to be inappropriate. Consider this poem entitled “Waste” by Harry Graham (2009):

I had written to Aunt Maud
Who was on a trip abroad
When I heard she’d died of cramp,
Just too late to save the stamp.

Reading the first three lines, we might feel pity for the bereaved nephew writing the poem. But the last line makes us reinterpret those lines. Far from being a loving nephew in mourning, he turns out to be an insensitive cheapskate. So the nervous energy of our pity, now superfluous, is released in laughter. That discharge occurs, Spencer says, first through the muscles “which feeling most habitually stimulates,” the muscles of the vocal tract. If still more energy needs to be relieved, it spills over to the muscles connected with breathing, and if the movements of those muscles do not release all the energy, the remainder moves the arms, legs, and other muscle groups (304).

In the 20th century, John Dewey (1894: 558–559) had a similar version of the Relief Theory. Laughter, he said, “marks the ending … of a period of suspense, or expectation.” It is a “sudden relaxation of strain, so far as occurring through the medium of the breathing and vocal apparatus… The laugh is thus a phenomenon of the same general kind as the sigh of relief.”

Better known than the versions of the Relief Theory of Shaftesbury, Spencer, and Dewey is that of Sigmund Freud. In his Jokes and Their Relation to the Unconscious (1905 [1974]), Freud analyzes three laughter situations: der Witz (often translated “jokes” or “joking”), “the comic,” and “humor.” In all three, laughter releases nervous energy that was summoned for a psychological task, but then became superfluous as that task was abandoned. In der Witz, that superfluous energy is energy used to repress feelings; in the comic it is energy used to think, and in humor it is the energy of feeling emotions. (In this article, we are not using humor in Freud’s narrow sense, but in the general sense that includes joking, wit, the comic, etc.)

Der Witz includes telling prepared fictional jokes, making spontaneous witty comments, and repartee. In der Witz, Freud says, the psychic energy released is the energy that would have repressed the emotions that are being expressed as the person laughs. (Most summaries of Freud’s theory mistakenly describe laughter as a release of repressed emotions themselves.) According to Freud, the emotions which are most repressed are sexual desire and hostility, and so most jokes and witty remarks are about sex, hostility, or both. In telling a sexual joke or listening to one, we bypass our internal censor and give vent to our libido. In telling or listening to a joke that puts down an individual or group we dislike, similarly, we let out the hostility we usually repress. In both cases, the psychic energy normally used to do the repressing becomes superfluous, and is released in laughter.

Freud’s second laughter situation, “the comic,” involves a similar release of energy that is summoned but is then found unnecessary. Here it is the energy normally devoted to thinking. An example is laughter at the clumsy actions of a clown. As we watch the clown stumble through actions that we would perform smoothly and efficiently, there is a saving of the energy that we would normally expend to understand the clown’s movements. Here Freud appeals to a theory of “mimetic representation” in which we expend a large packet of energy to understand something large and a small packet of energy to understand something small. Our mental representation of the clown’s clumsy movements, Freud says, calls for more energy than the energy we would expend to mentally represent our own smooth, efficient movements in performing the same task. Our laughter at the clown is our venting of that surplus energy.

These two possibilities in my imagination amount to a comparison between the observed movement and my own. If the other person’s movement is exaggerated and inexpedient, my increased expenditure in order to understand it is inhibited in statu nascendi, as it were in the act of being mobilized; it is declared superfluous and is free for use elsewhere or perhaps for discharge by laughter (Freud 1905 [1974], 254).

Freud analyzes the third laughter situation, which he calls “humor,” much as Spencer analyzed laughter in general. Humor occurs “if there is a situation in which, according to our usual habits, we should be tempted to release a distressing affect and if motives then operate upon us which suppress that affect in statu nascendi [in the process of being born]… . The pleasure of humor … comes about … at the cost of a release of affect that does not occur: it arise from an economy in the expenditure of affect” (293). His example is a story told by Mark Twain in which his brother was building a road when a charge of dynamite went off prematurely, blowing him high into the sky. When the poor man came down far from the work site, he was docked half a day’s pay for being “absent from his place of employment.” Freud’s explanation of our laughter at this story is like the explanation above at Graham’s poem about the cheapskate nephew. In laughing at this story, he says, we are releasing the psychic energy that we had summoned to feel pity for Twain’s brother, but that became superfluous when we heard the fantastic last part. “As a result of this understanding, the expenditure on the pity, which was already prepared, becomes unutilizable and we laugh it off” (295).

Having sketched several versions of the Relief Theory, we can note that today almost no scholar in philosophy or psychology explains laughter or humor as a process of releasing pent-up nervous energy. There is, of course, a connection between laughter and the expenditure of energy. Hearty laughter involves many muscle groups and several areas of the nervous system. Laughing hard gives our lungs a workout, too, as we take in far more oxygen than usual. But few contemporary scholars defend the claims of Spencer and Freud that the energy expended in laughter is the energy of feeling emotions, the energy of repressing emotions, or the energy of thinking, which have built up and require venting.

Funny things and situations may evoke emotions, but many seem not to. Consider P. G. Wodehouse’s line “If it’s feasible, let’s fease it.” Or the shortest poem in the English language, by Strickland Gillilan (1927), “Lines on the Antiquity of Microbes”:

Adam
Had’em.

These do not seem to vent emotions that had built up before we read them, and they do not seem to evoke emotions and then render them superfluous. So whatever energy is expended in laughing at them does not seem to be superfluous energy being vented. In fact, the whole hydraulic model of the nervous system on which the Relief Theory is based seems outdated.

To that hydraulic model, Freud adds several questionable claims derived from his general psychoanalytic theory of the mind. He says that the creation of der Witz—jokes and witty comments—is an unconscious process of letting repressed thoughts and feelings into the conscious mind. This claim seems falsified by professional humorists who approach the creation of jokes and cartoons with conscious strategies. Freud’s account of how psychic energy is vented in joke-telling is also questionable, especially his claim that packets of psychic energy are summoned to repress thoughts and feelings, but in statu nascendi (in the process of being born) are rendered superfluous. If Freud is right that the energy released in laughing at a joke is the energy normally used to repress hostile and sexual feelings, then it seems that those who laugh hardest at aggressive and sexual jokes should be people who usually repress such feelings. But studies about joke preferences by Hans Jurgen Eysenck (1972, xvi) have shown that the people who enjoy aggressive and sexual humor the most are not those who usually repress hostile and sexual feelings, but those who express them.

Freud’s account of “the comic” faces still more problems, particularly his ideas about “mimetic representation.” The psychic energy saved, he says, is energy summoned for understanding something, such as the antics of a clown. We summon a large packet of energy to understand the clown’s large movements, but as we are summoning it, we compare it with the small packet of energy required to understand our own smaller movements in doing the same thing. The difference between the two packets is surplus energy discharged in laughter. Freud’s account of thinking here is idiosyncratic and has strange implications, such as that thinking about swimming the English Channel takes far more energy than thinking about licking a stamp. With all these difficulties, it is not surprising that philosophers and psychologists studying humor today do not appeal to Freud’s theory to explain laughter or humor. More generally, the Relief Theory is seldom used as a general explanation of laughter or humor.

4. The Incongruity Theory

The second account of humor that arose in the 18th century to challenge the Superiority Theory was the Incongruity Theory. While the Superiority Theory says that the cause of laughter is feelings of superiority, and the Relief Theory says that it is the release of nervous energy, the Incongruity Theory says that it is the perception of something incongruous—something that violates our mental patterns and expectations. This approach was taken by James Beattie, Immanuel Kant, Arthur Schopenhauer, Søren Kierkegaard, and many later philosophers and psychologists. It is now the dominant theory of humor in philosophy and psychology.

Although Aristotle did not use the term incongruity, he hints that it is the basis for at least some humor. In the Rhetoric (3, 2), a handbook for speakers, he says that one way for a speaker to get a laugh is to create an expectation in the audience and then violate it. As an example, he cites this line from a comedy, “And as he walked, beneath his feet were—chilblains [sores on the feet].” Jokes that depend on a change of spelling or word play, he notes, can have the same effect. Cicero, in On the Orator (ch. 63), says that “The most common kind of joke is that in which we expect one thing and another is said; here our own disappointed expectation makes us laugh.”

This approach to joking is similar to techniques of stand-up comedians today. They speak of the set-up and the punch (line). The set-up is the first part of the joke: it creates the expectation. The punch (line) is the last part that violates that expectation. In the language of the Incongruity Theory, the joke’s ending is incongruous with the beginning.

The first philosopher to use the word incongruous to analyze humor was James Beattie (1779). When we see something funny, he says, our laughter “always proceeds from a sentiment or emotion, excited in the mind, in consequence of certain objects or ideas being presented to it” (304). Our laughter “seems to arise from the view of things incongruous united in the same assemblage” (318). The cause of humorous laughter is “two or more inconsistent, unsuitable, or incongruous parts or circumstances, considered as united in one complex object or assemblage, as acquiring a sort of mutual relation from the peculiar manner in which the mind takes notice of them” (320).

Immanuel Kant (1790 [1911], First Part, sec. 54), a contemporary of Beattie’s, did not used the term incongruous but had an explanation of laughter at jokes and wit that involves incongruity.

In everything that is to excite a lively convulsive laugh there must be something absurd (in which the understanding, therefore, can find no satisfaction). Laughter is an affection arising from the sudden transformation of a strained expectation into nothing. This transformation, which is certainly not enjoyable to the understanding, yet indirectly gives it very active enjoyment for a moment. Therefore its cause must consist in the influence of the representation upon the body, and the reflex effect of this upon the mind.

Kant illustrates with this story:

An Indian at the table of an Englishman in Surat, when he saw a bottle of ale opened and all the beer turned into froth and overflowing, testified his great astonishment with many exclamations. When the Englishman asked him, “What is there in this to astonish you so much?” he answered, “I am not at all astonished that it should flow out, but I do wonder how you ever got it in.”

We laugh at this story, Kant says, “not because we deem ourselves cleverer than this ignorant man, or because of anything in it that we note as satisfactory to the understanding, but because our expectation was strained (for a time) and then was suddenly dissipated into nothing.”

“We must note well,” Kant insists, that it [our expectation] does not transform itself into the positive opposite of an expected object… but it must be transformed into nothing.” He illustrates with two more jokes:

The heir of a rich relative wished to arrange for an imposing funeral, but he lamented that he could not properly succeed; ‘for’ (said he) ‘the more money I give my mourners to look sad, the more cheerful they look!’

[A] merchant returning from India to Europe with all his wealth in merchandise … was forced to throw it overboard in a heavy storm and … grieved thereat so much that his wig turned gray the same night.”

A joke amuses us by evoking, shifting, and dissipating our thoughts, but we do not learn anything through these mental gymnastics. In humor generally, according to Kant, our reason finds nothing of worth. The jostling of ideas, however, produces a physical jostling of our internal organs and we enjoy that physical stimulation.

For if we admit that with all our thoughts is harmonically combined a movement in the organs of the body, we will easily comprehend how to this sudden transposition of the mind, now to one now to another standpoint in order to contemplate its object, may correspond an alternating tension and relaxation of the elastic portions of our intestines which communicates itself to the diaphragm (like that which ticklish people feel). In connection with this the lungs expel the air at rapidly succeeding intervals, and thus bring about a movement beneficial to health; which alone, and not what precedes it in the mind, is the proper cause of the gratification in a thought that at bottom represents nothing.

On this point, Kant compares the enjoyment of joking and wit to the enjoyment of games of chance and the enjoyment of music. In all three the pleasure is in a “changing free play of sensations,” which is caused by shifting ideas in the mind. In games of chance, “the play of fortune” causes bodily excitation; in music, it is “the play of tone,” and in joking, it is “the play of thought.” In a lively game of chance, “the affections of hope, fear, joy, wrath, scorn, are put in play … alternating every moment; and they are so vivid that by them, as by a kind of internal motion, all the vital processes of the body seem to be promoted.” In music and humor, similarly, what we enjoy are bodily changes caused by rapidly shifting ideas.

Music and that which excites laughter are two different kinds of play with aesthetical ideas, or of representations of the understanding through which ultimately nothing is thought, which can give lively gratification merely by their changes. Thus we recognize pretty clearly that the animation in both cases is merely bodily, although it is excited by ideas of the mind; and that the feeling of health produced by a motion of the intestines corresponding to the play in question makes up that whole gratification of a gay party.

A version of the Incongruity Theory that gave it more philosophical significance than Kant’s version is that of Arthur Schopenhauer (1818/1844 [1907]). While Kant located the lack of fit in humor between our expectations and our experience, Schopenhauer locates it between our sense perceptions of things and our abstract rational knowledge of those same things. We perceive unique individual things with many properties. But when we group our sense perceptions under abstract concepts, we focus on just one or a few properties of any individual thing. Thus we lump quite different things under one concept and one word. Think, for example, of a Chihuahua and a St. Bernard categorized under dog. For Schopenhauer, humor arises when we suddenly notice the incongruity between a concept and a perception that are supposed to be of the same thing.

Many human actions can only be performed by the help of reason and deliberation, and yet there are some which are better performed without its assistance. This very incongruity of sensuous and abstract knowledge, on account of which the latter always merely approximates to the former, as mosaic approximates to painting, is the cause of a very remarkable phenomenon which, like reason itself, is peculiar to human nature, and of which the explanations that have ever anew been attempted, as insufficient: I mean laughter… . The cause of laughter in every case is simply the sudden perception of the incongruity between a concept and the real objects which have been thought through it in some relation, and laughter itself is just the expression of this incongruity (1818/1844 [1907], Book I, sec. 13).

As an example, Schopenhauer tells of the prison guards who allowed a convict to play cards with them, but when they caught him cheating, they kicked him out. He comments, “They let themselves be led by the general conception, ‘Bad companions are turned out,’ and forget that he is also a prisoner, i. e., one whom they ought to hold fast” (Supplement to Book I: Ch. 8). He also comments on an Austrian joke (the equivalent of a Polish joke in the U.S. a few decades ago):

When someone had declared that he was fond of walking alone, an Austrian said to him: “You like walking alone; so do I: therefore we can go together.” He starts from the conception, “A pleasure which two love they can enjoy in common,” and subsumes under it the very case which excludes community.

Creating jokes like these requires the ability to think of an abstract idea under which very different things can be subsumed. Wit, Schopenhauer says, “consists entirely in a facility for finding for every object that appears a conception under which it certainly can be thought, though it is very different from all the other objects which come under this conception” (Supplement to Book I, Ch. 8).

With this theory of humor as based on the discrepancy between abstract ideas and real things, Schopenhauer explains the offensiveness of being laughed at, the kind of laughter at the heart of the Superiority Theory.

That the laughter of others at what we do or say seriously offends us so keenly depends on the fact that it asserts that there is a great incongruity between our conceptions and the objective realities. For the same reason, the predicate “ludicrous” or “absurd” is insulting. The laugh of scorn announces with triumph to the baffled adversary how incongruous were the conceptions he cherished with the reality which is now revealing itself to him (Supplement to Book I, Ch. 8).

With his theory, too, Schopenhauer explains the pleasure of humor.

In every suddenly appearing conflict between what is perceived and what is thought, what is perceived is always unquestionably right; for it is not subject to error at all, requires no confirmation from without, but answers for itself. … The victory of knowledge of perception over thought affords us pleasure. For perception is the original kind of knowledge inseparable from animal nature, in which everything that gives direct satisfaction to the will presents itself. It is the medium of the present, of enjoyment and gaiety; moreover it is attended with no exertion. With thinking the opposite is the case: it is the second power of knowledge, the exercise of which always demands some, and often considerable exertion. Besides, it is the conceptions of thought that often oppose the gratification of our immediate desires, for, as the medium of the past, the future, and of seriousness, they are the vehicles of our fears, our repentance, and all our cares. It must therefore be diverting to us to see this strict, untiring, troublesome governess, the reason, for once convicted of insufficiency. On this account then the mien or appearance of laughter is very closely related to that of joy (Supplement to Book I, Ch. 8).

Like Schopenhauer, Søren Kierkegaard saw humor as based on incongruity and as philosophically significant. In his discussion of the “three spheres of existence,” (the three existential stages of life—the aesthetic, the ethical, and the religious), he discusses humor and its close relative, irony. Irony marks the boundary between the aesthetic and the ethical spheres, while humor marks the boundary between the ethical and religious spheres. “Humor is the last stage of existential awareness before faith” (1846 [1941], 448, 259). The person with a religious view of life is likely to cultivate humor, he says, and Christianity is the most humorous view of life in world history ([JP], Entries 1681–1682).

Kierkegaard (1846 [1941], 459–468) locates the essence of humor, which he calls “the comical,” in a disparity between what is expected and what is experienced, though instead of calling it “incongruity” he calls it “contradiction.” For example, “Errors are comical, and are all to be explained by the contradiction involved.” He cites the story of the baker who said to the begging woman, “No, mother, I cannot give you anything. There was another here recently whom I had to send away without giving anything, too: we cannot give to everybody.”

The violation of our expectations is at the heart of the tragic as well as the comic, Kierkegaard says. To contrast the two, he appeals to Aristotle’s definition of the comic in Chapter 5 of The Poetics: “The ridiculous is a mistake or unseemliness that is not painful or destructive.”

The tragic and the comic are the same, in so far as both are based on contradiction; but the tragic is the suffering contradiction, the comical, the painless contradiction… . The comic apprehension evokes the contradiction or makes it manifest by having in mind the way out, which is why the contradiction is painless. The tragic apprehension sees the contradiction and despairs of a way out.

A few decades earlier, William Hazlitt contrasted the tragic and comic this way in his essay “On Wit and Humor”:

Man is the only animal that laughs and weeps: for he is the only animal that is struck with the difference between what things are, and what they ought to be. We weep at what thwarts or exceeds our desires in serious matters; we laugh at what only disappoints our expectations in trifles… . To explain the nature of laughter and tears, is to account for the condition of human life; for it is in a manner compounded of the two! It is a tragedy or a comedy—sad or merry, as it happens… . Tears may be considered as the natural and involuntary resource of the mind overcome by some sudden and violent emotion, before it has had time to reconcile its feelings to the change of circumstances: while laughter may be defined to be the same sort of convulsive and involuntary movement, occasioned by mere surprise or contrast (in the absence of any more serious emotion), before it has time to reconcile its belief to contrary appearances (Hazlitt 1819 [1907], 1).

The core meaning of “incongruity” in various versions of the Incongruity Theory, then, is that some thing or event we perceive or think about violates our standard mental patterns and normal expectations. (If we are listening to a joke for the second time, of course, there is a sense in which we expect the incongruous punch line, but it still violates our ordinary expectations.) Beyond that core meaning, various thinkers have added different details, many of which are incompatible with each other. In contemporary psychology, for example, theorists such as Thomas Schultz (1976) and Jerry Suls (1972, 1983) have claimed that what we enjoy in humor is not incongruity itself, but the resolution of incongruity. After age seven, Schultz says, we require the fitting of the apparently anomalous element into some conceptual schema. That is what happens when we “get” a joke. Indeed, Schultz does not even call unresolvable incongruity “humor”—he calls it “nonsense.” The examples cited are typically jokes in which the punch line is momentarily confusing, but then the hearer reinterprets the first part so that it makes a kind of sense. When, for instance, Mae West said, “Marriage is a great institution, but I’m not ready for an institution,” the shift in meanings of “institution” is the incongruity, but it takes a moment to follow that shift, and the pleasure is in figuring out that the word has two meanings. Amusement, according to this understanding of humor, is akin to puzzle-solving. Other theorists insist that incongruity-resolution figures in only some humor, and that the pleasure of amusement is not like puzzle-solving.

As philosophers and psychologists refined the Incongruity Theory in the late 20th century, one flaw in several older versions came to light: they said, or more often implied, that the perception of incongruity is sufficient for humor. That is clearly false, since when our mental patterns and expectations are violated, we may well feel fear, disgust, or anger and not amusement. James Beattie, the first philosopher to analyze humor as a response to incongruity, was careful to point out that laughter is only one such response. Our perception of incongruity will not excite the “risible emotion,” he said, when that perception is “attended with some other emotion of greater authority” such as fear, pity, moral disapprobation, indignation, or disgust (1779, 420).

One way to correct this flaw is to say that humorous amusement is not just any response to incongruity, but a way of enjoying incongruity. Michael Clark, for example, offers these three features as necessary and sufficient for humor:

  1. A person perceives (thinks, imagines) an object as being incongruous.
  2. The person enjoys perceiving (thinking, imagining) the object.
  3. The person enjoys the perceived (thought, imagined) incongruity at least partly for itself, rather than solely for some ulterior reason (in Morreall 1987, 139–155).

This version of the Incongruity Theory is an improvement on theories which describe amusement as the perception of incongruity, but it still seems not specific enough. Amusement is one way of enjoying incongruity, but not the only way. Mike W. Martin offers several examples from the arts (in Morreall, 1987, 176). Sophocles’ Oedipus the King has many lines in which Oedipus vows to do whatever it takes to bring King Laius’ killer to justice. We in the audience, knowing that Oedipus is himself that killer, may enjoy the incongruity of a king threatening himself, but that enjoyment need not be humorous amusement. John Morreall (1987, 204–205) argues that a number of aesthetic categories— the grotesque, the macabre, the horrible, the bizarre, and the fantastic—involve a non-humorous enjoyment of some violation of our mental patterns and expectations.

Whatever refinements the Incongruity Theory might require, it seems better able to account for laughter and humor than the scientifically obsolete Relief Theory. It also seems more comprehensive than the Superiority Theory since it can account for kinds of humor that do not seem based on superiority, such as puns and other wordplay.

5. Humor as Play, Laughter as Play Signal

While the Incongruity Theory made humor look less objectionable than the Superiority Theory did, it has not improved philosophers’ opinions of humor much in the last two centuries, at least judging from what they have published. Part of the continued bad reputation of humor comes from a new objection triggered by the Incongruity Theory: If humor is enjoying the violation of our mental patterns and expectations, then it is irrational. This Irrationality Objection is almost as old as the Incongruity Theory, and is implicit in Kant’s claim that the pleasure in laughter is only physical and not intellectual. “How could a delusive expectation gratify?” he asks. According to Kant, humor feels good in spite of, not because of, the way it frustrates our desire to understand. George Santayana (1896, 248) agreed, arguing that incongruity itself could not be enjoyed.

We have a prosaic background of common sense and everyday reality; upon this background an unexpected idea suddenly impinges. But the thing is a futility. The comic accident falsifies the nature before us, starts a wrong analogy in the mind, a suggestion that cannot be carried out. In a word, we are in the presence of an absurdity, and man, being a rational animal, can like absurdity no better than he can like hunger or cold.

If the widespread contemporary appreciation of humor is defensible, then this Irrationality Objection needs to be addressed. To do that seems to require an explanation of how our higher mental functions can operate in a beneficial way that is different from theoretical and practical reasoning. One way to construct that explanation is to analyze humor as a kind of play, and explain how such play can be beneficial.

Remarkably few philosophers have even mentioned that humor is a kind of play, much less seen benefits in such play. Kant spoke of joking as “the play of thought,” though he saw no value in it beyond laughter’s stimulation of the internal organs. One of the few to classify humor as play and see value in the mental side of humor was Thomas Aquinas. He followed the lead of Aristotle, who said in the Nicomachean Ethics (Ch. 8) that “Life includes rest as well as activity, and in this is included leisure and amusement.” Some people carry amusement to excess—“vulgar buffoons,” Aristotle calls them—but just as bad are “those who can neither make a joke themselves nor put up with those who do,” whom he calls “boorish and unpolished.” Between buffoonery and boorishness there is a happy medium—engaging in humor at the right time and place, and to the right degree. This virtue Aristotle calls eutrapelia, ready-wittedness, from the Greek for “turning well.” In his Summa Theologiae (2a2ae, Q. 168) Aquinas extends Aristotle’s ideas in three articles: “Whether there can be virtue in actions done in play,” “The sin of playing too much,” and “The sin of playing too little.” He agrees with Aristotle that humor and other forms of play provide occasional rest:

As bodily tiredness is eased by resting the body, so psychological tiredness is eased by resting the soul. As we have explained in discussing the feelings, pleasure is rest for the soul. And therefore the remedy for weariness of soul lies in slackening the tension of mental study and taking some pleasure… . Those words and deeds in which nothing is sought beyond the soul’s pleasure are called playful or humorous, and it is necessary to make use of them at times for solace of soul (2a2ae, Q. 168, Art. 2).

Beyond providing rest for the soul, Aquinas suggests that humor has social benefits. Extending the meaning of Aristotle’s eutrapelia, he talks about “a eutrapelos, a pleasant person with a happy cast of mind who gives his words and deeds a cheerful turn.” The person who is never playful or humorous, Aquinas says, is acting “against reason” and so is guilty of a vice.

Anything conflicting with reason in human action is vicious. It is against reason for a man to be burdensome to others, by never showing himself agreeable to others or being a kill-joy or wet blanket on their enjoyment. And so Seneca says, “Bear yourself with wit, lest you be regarded as sour or despised as dull.” Now those who lack playfulness are sinful, those who never say anything to make you smile, or are grumpy with those who do (2a2ae, Q. 168, Art. 4).

In the last century an early play theory of humor was developed by Max Eastman (1936), who found parallels to humor in the play of animals, particularly in the laughter of chimps during tickling. He argues that “we come into the world endowed with an instinctive tendency to laugh and have this feeling in response to pains presented playfully” (45). In humor and play generally, according to Eastman, we take a disinterested attitude toward something that could instead be treated seriously.

In the late 20th century Ted Cohen (1999) wrote about the social benefits of joke-telling, and many psychologists confirmed Aquinas’ assessment of humor as virtuous. A chapter in the American Psychological Association’s Character Strengths and Virtues: A Handbook and Classification, under “Strengths of Transcendence,” is “Humor [Playfulness].” Engaging in humor can foster a tolerance for ambiguity and diversity, and promote creative problem-solving. It can serve as a social lubricant, engendering trust and reducing conflict. In communications that tend to evoke negative emotions--announcing bad news, apologizing, complaining, warning, criticizing, commanding, evaluating--humor can provide delight that reduces or even blocks negative emotions. Consider this paragraph from a debt-collection letter:

We appreciate your business, but, please, give us a break. Your account is overdue ten months. That means we’ve carried you longer than your mother did (Morreall 2009, 117).

Play activities such as humor are not usually pursued in order to achieve such benefits, of course; they are pursued, as Aquinas said, for pleasure. A parallel with humor here is music, which we typically play and listen to for pleasure, but which can boost our manual dexterity and even mathematical abilities, reduce stress, and strengthen our social bonds.

Ethologists (students of animal, including human, behavior) point out that in play activities, young animals learn important skills they will need later on. Young lions, for example, play by going through actions that will be part of hunting. Humans have hunted with rocks and spears for tens of thousands of years, and so boys often play by throwing projectiles at targets. Marek Spinka (2001) observes that in playing, young animals move in exaggerated ways. Young monkeys leap not just from branch to branch, but from trees into rivers. Children not only run, but skip and do cartwheels. Spinka suggests that in play young animals are testing the limits of their speed, balance, and coordination. In doing so, they learn to cope with unexpected situations such as being chased by a new kind of predator.

This account of the value of play in children and young animals does not automatically explain why humor is important to adult humans, but for us as for children and young animals, the play activities that seem the most fun are those in which we exercise our abilities in unusual and extreme ways, yet in a safe setting. Sports is an example. So is humor.

In humor the abilities we exercise in unusual and extreme ways in a safe setting are related to thinking and interacting with other people. What is enjoyed is incongruity, the violation of our mental patterns and expectations. In joking with friends, for example, we break rules of conversation such as these formulated by H. P. Grice (1975):

  1. Do not say what you believe to be false.
  2. Do not say that for which you lack adequate evidence.
  3. Avoid obscurity of expression.
  4. Avoid ambiguity.
  5. Be brief.

We break Rule 1 when for a laugh we exaggerate wildly, say the opposite of what we think, or “pull someone’s leg.” We break Rule 2 when we present funny fantasies as if they were facts. Rule 3 is broken to create humor when we reply to an embarrassing questions with an obviously vague or confusing answer. We violate Rule 4 in telling most prepared jokes, as Victor Raskin (1984) has shown. A comment or story starts off with an assumed interpretation for a phrase, but then at the punch line, switches to a second, usually opposed interpretation. Consider Mae West’s line “Marriage is a great institution—but I’m not ready for an institution.” Rule 5 is broken when we turn an ordinary complaint into a comic rant like those of Roseanne Barr and Lewis Black.

Humor, like other play, sometimes takes the form of activity that would not be mistaken for serious activity. Wearing a red clown nose and making up nonsense syllables are examples. More often, however, as in the conversational moves above, humor and play are modeled on serious activities. When in conversation we switch from serious discussion to making funny comments, for example, we keep the same vocabulary and grammar, and our sentences transcribed to paper might look like bona-fide assertions, questions, etc. This similarity between non-serious and serious language and actions calls for ways that participants can distinguish between the two. Ethologists call these ways “play signals.”

The oldest play signals in humans are smiling and laughing. According to ethologists, these evolved from similar play signals in pre-human apes. The apes that evolved into Homo sapiens split off from the apes that evolved into chimpanzees and gorillas about six million years ago. In chimps and gorillas, as in other mammals, play usually takes the form of mock-aggression such as chasing, wrestling, biting, and tickling. According to many ethologists, mock-aggression was the earliest form of play, from which all other play developed (Aldis 1975, 139; Panksepp 1993, 150). In mock-aggressive play, it is critical that all participants are aware that the activity is not real aggression. Without a way to distinguish between being chased or bitten playfully and being attacked in earnest, an animal might respond with deadly force. In the anthropoid apes, play signals are visual and auditory. Jan van Hooff (1972, 212–213) and others speculate that the first play signals in humans evolved from two facial displays in an ancestor of both humans and the great apes that are still found in gorillas and chimps. One was the “grin face” or “social grimace”: the corners of the mouth and the lips are retracted to expose the gums, the jaws are closed, there is no vocalization, body movement is inhibited, and the eyes are directed toward an interacting partner. This “silent bared-teeth display,” according to van Hooff (1972, 217), evolved into the human social smile of appeasement.

In the other facial display, the lips are relaxed and the mouth open, and breathing is shallow and staccato, like panting. This vocalization in chimpanzees is on the in-breath: “Ahh ahh ahh.” According to van Hooff, this “relaxed open-mouth display” or “play face” evolved into human laughter. The relaxed mouth in laughter contrasts with the mouth in real aggression that is tense and prepared to bite hard. That difference, combined with the distinctive shallow, staccato breathing pattern, allows laughter to serve as a play signal, announcing that “This is just for fun; it’s not real fighting.” Chimps and gorillas show that face and vocalization during rough-and-tumble play, and it can be elicited in them by the playful grabbing and poking we call tickling (Andrew 1963).

As early hominin species began walking upright and the front limbs were no longer used for locomotion, the muscles in the chest no longer had to synchronize breathing with locomotion. The larynx moved to a lower position in the throat, and the pharynx developed, allowing early humans to modulate their breathing and vocalize in complex ways (Harris 1989, 77). Eventually they would speak, but before that they came to laugh in our human way: “ha ha ha” on the out-breath instead of “ahh ahh ahh” on the in-breath.

In the last decade, thinkers in evolutionary psychology have extended van Hooff’s work, relating humor to such things as sexual selection (Greengross 2008; Li et al. 2009). In the competition for women to mate with, early men may have engaged in humor to show their intelligence, cleverness, adaptability, and desire to please others.

The hypothesis that laughter evolved as a play signal is appealing in several ways. Unlike the Superiority and Incongruity Theories, it explains the link between humor and the facial expression, body language, and sound of laughter. It also explains why laughter is overwhelmingly a social experience, as those theories do not. According to one estimate, we are thirty times more likely to laugh with other people than when we are alone (Provine 2000, 45). Tracing laughter to a play signal in early humans also accords with the fact that young children today laugh during the same activities—chasing, wrestling, and tickling—in which chimps and gorillas show their play face and laugh-like vocalizations. The idea that laughter and humor evolved from mock-aggression, furthermore, helps explain why so much humor today, especially in males, is playfully aggressive.

The playful aggression found in much humor has been widely misunderstood by philosophers, especially in discussions of the ethics of humor. Starting with Plato, most philosophers have treated humor that represents people in a negative light as if it were real aggression toward those people. Jokes in which blondes or Poles are extraordinarily stupid, blacks extraordinarily lazy, Italians extraordinarily cowardly, lawyers extraordinarily self-centered, women extraordinarily unmathematical, etc. have usually been analyzed as if they were bona fide assertions that blondes or Poles are extraordinarily stupid, blacks extraordinarily lazy, etc. This approach is announced in the title of Michael Philips’ “Racist Acts and Racist Humor”(1984). Philips classifies Polish jokes as racist, for example, but anyone who understands their popularity in the 1960s, knows that they did not involve hostility toward Polish people, who had long been assimilated into North American society. Consider the joke about the Polish astronaut calling a press conference to announce that he was going to fly a rocket to the sun. When asked how he would handle the sun’s intense heat, he said, “Don’t worry, I’ll go at night.” To enjoy this joke, it is not necessary to have racist beliefs or attitudes towards Poles, any more than it is necessary to believe that Poland has a space program. This is a fantasy enjoyed for its clever depiction of unbelievable stupidity.

While playing with negative stereotypes in jokes does not require endorsement of those stereotypes, however, it still keeps them in circulation, and that can be harmful in a racist or sexist culture where stereotypes support prejudice and injustice. Jokes can be morally objectionable for perpetuating stereotypes that need to be eliminated. More generally, humor can be morally objectionable when it treats as a subject for play something that should be taken seriously. (Morreall 2009, ch. 5). Here humor often blocks compassion and responsible action. An egregious example is the cover of the July 1974 National Lampoon magazine, titled the “Dessert Issue.” A few years earlier George Harrison and other musicians had organized a charity concert to benefit the victims of a famine in Bangladesh. From it they produced the record album Concert for Bangladesh. The album cover featured a photograph of a starving child with a begging bowl. The photo on the cover of National Lampoon’s “Dessert Issue” was virtually the same, only it was of a chocolate sculpture of a starving child, with part of the head bitten off.

Having sketched an account of humor as play with words and ideas, we need to go further in order to counter the Irrationality Objection, especially since that play is based on violating mental patterns and expectations. What must be added is an explanation of how playfully violating mental patterns and expectations could foster rationality rather than undermine it.

Part of rationality is thinking abstractly—in a way that is not tied to one’s immediate experience and individual perspective. If at a dinner party I spill a blob of ketchup on my shirt that looks like a bullet hole, I could be locked into a Here/Now/Me/Practical mode in which I think only about myself and my soiled shirt. Or I could think about embarrassing moments like this as experienced by millions of people over the centuries. More abstract still would be to think, as the Buddha did, about how human life is full of problems.

In the lower animals, mental processing is not abstract but tied to present experience, needs, and opportunities. It is about nearby predators, food, mates, etc. When something violates their expectations, especially something involving a potential or actual loss, their typical reaction is fear, anger, or sadness. These emotions evolved in mammals and were useful for millions of years because they motivate adaptive behavior such as fighting, fleeing, withdrawing from activity, and avoiding similar situations in the future.

Fear, anger, and sadness are still sometimes adaptive in humans: A snarling dog scares us, for example, and we move away quickly, avoiding a nasty bite. But if human mental development had not gone beyond such emotions, with their Here/Now/Me/Practical focus, we would not have become rational animals. What early humans needed was a way to react to the violation of their expectations that transcended their immediate experience and their individual perspective. Humorous amusement provided that. In the humorous frame of mind, we experience, think about, or even create something that violates our understanding of how things are supposed to be. But we suspend the personal, practical concerns that lead to negative emotions, and enjoy the oddness of what is occurring. If the incongruous situation is our own failure or mistake, we view it in the way we view the failures and mistakes of other people. This perspective is more abstract, objective, and rational than an emotional perspective. As the theme song of the old Candid Camera television program used to say, we “see ourselves as other people do.” Instead of tensing up and preparing to run away or attack, we relax and laugh. In laughter, as Wallace Chafe said in The Importance of Not Being Earnest (2007), not only do we not do anything, but we are disabled as we lose muscle control in our torsos, arms, and legs. In extremely heavy laughter, we fall on the floor and wet our pants.

The nonpractical attitude in humor would not be beneficial, of course, if I were in imminent danger. If instead of ketchup, I spilled sulfuric acid on my shirt, the Here/Now/Me/Practical narrow focus of fear would be preferable to the disengaged, playful attitude of humor. When immediate action is called for, humor is no substitute. But in many situations where our expectations are violated, no action would help. In the Poetics (5, 1449a) Aristotle said that what is funny is “a mistake or unseemliness that is not painful or destructive.” But people have joked about problems as grave as their own impending death. As he approached the gallows, Thomas More asked the executioner, “Could you help me up. I’ll be able to get down by myself.” On his deathbed, the story goes, Oscar Wilde said: “This wallpaper is atrocious. One of us has to go.”

Not only does such joking foster rationality and provide pleasure, but it reduces or eliminates the combination of fear and/or anger called “stress,” which is at epidemic levels in the industrialized world. In fear and anger, chemicals such as epinephrine, norepinephrine, and cortisol are released into the blood, causing an increase in muscle tension, heart rate, and blood pressure, and a suppression of the immune system. Those physiological changes evolved in earlier mammals as a way to energize them to fight or flee, and in early humans, they were usually responses to physical dangers such as predators or enemies. Today, however, our bodies and brains react in the same way to problems that are not physically threatening, such as overbearing bosses and work deadlines. The increased muscle tension, the spike in blood pressure, and other changes in stress not only do not help us with such problems, but cause new ones such as headaches and heart attacks. When in potentially stressful situations we shift to the play mode of humor, our heart rate, blood pressure, and muscle tension decrease, as do levels of epinephrine, norepinephrine, and cortisol. Laughter also increases pain tolerance and boosts the activity of the immune system, which stress suppresses (Morreall 1997, ch. 4; Morreall 2016, ch. 5-6).

A century ago, when psychologists still talked like philosophers, an editorial in the American Journal of Psychology (October 1907) said of humor that “Perhaps its largest function is to detach us from our world of good and evil, of loss and gain, and to enable us to see it in proper perspective. It frees us from vanity, on the one hand, and from pessimism, on the other, by keeping us larger than what we do, and greater than what can happen to us.”

6. Comedy

While there is only speculation about how humor developed in early humans, we know that by the late 6th century BCE the Greeks had institutionalized it in the ritual known as comedy, and that it was performed with a contrasting dramatic form known as tragedy. Both were based on the violation of mental patterns and expectations, and in both the world is a tangle of conflicting systems where humans live in the shadow of failure, folly, and death. Like tragedy, comedy represents life as full of tension, danger, and struggle, with success or failure often depending on chance factors. Where they differ is in the responses of the lead characters to life’s incongruities. Identifying with these characters, audiences at comedies and tragedies have contrasting responses to events in the dramas. And because these responses carry over to similar situations in life, comedy and tragedy embody contrasting responses to the incongruities in life.

Tragedy valorizes serious, emotional engagement with life’s problems, even struggle to the death. Along with epic, it is part of the Western heroic tradition that extols ideals, the willingness to fight for them, and honor. The tragic ethos is linked to patriarchy and militarism—many of its heroes are kings and conquerors—and it valorizes what Conrad Hyers (1996) calls Warrior Virtues—blind obedience, the willingness to kill or die on command, unquestioning loyalty, single-mindedness, resoluteness of purpose, and pride.

Comedy, by contrast, embodies an anti-heroic, pragmatic attitude toward life’s incongruities. From Aristophanes’ Lysistrata to Charlie Chaplin’s The Great Dictator to Michael Moore’s Fahrenheit 9/11, comedy has mocked the irrationality of militarism and blind respect for authority. Its own methods of handling conflict include deal-making, trickery, getting an enemy drunk, and running away. As the Irish saying goes, you’re only a coward for a moment, but you’re dead for the rest of your life. In place of Warrior Virtues, it extols critical thinking, cleverness, adaptability, and an appreciation of physical pleasures like eating, drinking, and sex.

Along with the idealism of tragedy goes elitism. The people who matter are kings, queens, and generals. In comedy there are more characters and more kinds of characters, women are more prominent, and many protagonists come from lower classes. Everybody counts for one. That shows in the language of comedy, which, unlike the elevated language of tragedy, is common speech. The basic unit in tragedy is the individual, in comedy it is the family, group of friends, or bunch of co-workers.

While tragic heroes are emotionally engaged with their problems, comic protagonists show emotional disengagement. They think, rather than feel, their way through difficulties. By presenting such characters as role models, comedy has implicitly valorized the benefits of humor that are now being empirically verified, such as that it is psychologically and physically healthy, it fosters mental flexibility, and it serves as a social lubricant. With a few exceptions like Aquinas, philosophers have ignored these benefits.

If philosophers wanted to undo the traditional prejudices against humor, they might consider the affinities between one contemporary genre of comedy—standup comedy—and philosophy itself. There are at least seven. First, standup comedy and philosophy are conversational: like the dialogue format that started with Plato, standup routines are interactive. Second, both reflect on familiar experiences, especially puzzling ones. We wake from a vivid dream, for example, not sure what has happened and what is happening. Third, like philosophers, standup comics often approach puzzling experiences with questions. “If I thought that dream was real, how do I know that I’m not dreaming right now?” The most basic starting point in both philosophy and standup comedy is “X—what’s up with that?” Fourth, as they think about familiar experiences, both philosophers and comics step back emotionally from them. Henri Bergson (1900 [1911]) spoke of the “momentary anaesthesia of the heart” in laughter. Emotional disengagement long ago became a meaning of “philosophical”—“rational, sensibly composed, calm, as in a difficult situation.” Fifth, philosophers and standup comics think critically. They ask whether familiar ideas make sense, and they refuse to defer to authority and tradition. It was for his critical thinking that Socrates was executed. So were cabaret comics in Germany who mocked the Third Reich. Sixth, in thinking critically, philosophers and standup comics pay careful attention to language. Attacking sloppy and illogical uses of words is standard in both, and so is finding exactly the right words to express an idea. Seventh, the pleasure of standup comedy is often like the pleasure of doing philosophy. In both we relish new ways of looking at things and delight in surprising thoughts. Cleverness is prized. William James (1911 [1979], 11) said that philosophy “sees the familiar as if it were strange, and the strange as if it were familiar.” The same is true of standup comedy. Simon Critchley has written that both ask us to “look at things as if you had just landed from another planet” (2002, 1).

One recent philosopher attuned to the affinity between comedy and philosophy was Bertrand Russell. “The point of philosophy,” he said, “is to start with something so simple as not to seem worth stating, and to end with something so paradoxical that no one will believe it” (1918, 53). In the middle of an argument, he once observed, “This seems plainly absurd: but whoever wishes to become a philosopher must learn not to be frightened by absurdities” (2008 [1912], 17).

Often writing for popular audiences, Russell had many quips that would fit nicely into a comedy routine:

  • The fundamental cause of trouble is that in the modern world the stupid are cocksure while the intelligent are full of doubt” (1998, 28).
  • Most people would die sooner than think—in fact they do so” (1925a, 166).
  • Man is a rational animal—so at least I have been told. Throughout a long life, I have looked diligently for evidence in favor of this statement, but so far I have not had the good fortune to come across it, though I have searched in many countries spread over three continents” (1950, 71).
  • Mathematics may be defined as the subject in which we never know what we are talking about, nor whether what we are saying is true” (1925b, 75).

For more examples of the affinities between comedy and philosophy, there is a series of books on philosophy and popular culture from Open Court Publishing that includes: Seinfeld and Philosophy (2002), The Simpsons and Philosophy (2001), Woody Allen and Philosophy (2004), and Monty Python and Philosophy (2006). Thomas Cathcart and Daniel Klein have written Plato and Platypus Walked into a Bar … : Understanding Philosophy through Jokes (2008), and Heidegger and a Hippo Walk Through Those Pearly Gates: Using Philosophy (and Jokes!) to Explore Life, Death, the Afterlife, and Everything in Between (2009). In philosophy of mind, Matthew Hurley, Daniel Dennett, and Reginald Adams (2011) have used humor to explain the development of the human mind. In aesthetics, Noël Carroll (1999, 2003, 2007, 2013) has written about philosophical implications of comedy and humor, and about their relationships with the genre of horror. The journals Philosophy East and West (1989), the Monist (2005), and Educational Philosophy and Theory (2014) have published special issues on humor. The ancient prejudices against humor that started with Plato are finally starting to crumble.

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