Derivation of STAT FUNC

The result is proved for a pure state and a non-degenerate discrete observable A with eigenvalues a_i.

We first rewrite the statistical algorithm for projection operators:

(1) prob(v(A)^| ψ> = a_k) = Tr(P_| ak> · P_| ψ>)

For an arbitrary function f: R → R (where R is the set of real numbers) we define the function of an observable A as:

f(A) =_df Σ_i f(a_i) P_| ai>

Moreover, we introduce the characteristic function χ_a as:

χa(x)	= 1 for x = a
	= 0 for x ≠ a

As a result, we can rewrite a project operator P_| ak> as:

(2) P_| ak> = χ_ak(A)

and thus the statistical algorithm as:

prob(v(A)^| ψ>=a_k) = Tr(χ_ak(A) · P_| ψ>)

We also use a simple mathematical property of characteristic functions:

χ_a(f(x)) = χ_f⁻¹(a)(x)

whence we can also write:

(3) χ_a(f(A)) = χ_f⁻¹(a)(A)

Then:

prob(v(f(A))| φ> = b)	=	Tr(P| b> · P| φ>)	(by (1))
	=	Tr(χb(f(A)) · P| φ>)	(by (2))
	=	Tr(χf−1(b)(A) · P| φ>)	(by (3))
	=	Tr(P| f−1(b)> · P| φ>)	(by (2))
	=	prob(v(A)| φ> = f−1(b))	(by (1))

Hence:

prob(v(f(A))^| φ> = b)    =    prob(v(A)^| φ> = f⁻¹(b))

Now since

v(A) = f⁻¹(b)    ⇔    f(v(A)) = b,

we have

prob(v(f(A))^| φ> = b)    =    prob(f(v(A))^| φ> = b)

which is STAT FUNC.

Return to The Kochen-Specker Theorem