Notes to Latin American Philosophy

1. For examples, see Maffie (2010) and Dussel (1995). Much of the recent re-evaluation of pre-Columbian thought is owed to the pioneering work of Miguel León Portilla (1963).

2. Matters are more complicated if one considers such factors as lived experiences and folk beliefs. For example, anthropologist Bonfil Batalla (1996) has argued that important aspects of an indigenous worldview have persisted into the lived experience of modern Mexicans. Moreover, religious syncretism is a long-standing feature of Catholicism in Latin America.

3. For some recent permutations of that debate, see Mendieta (1999), Nuccetelli (2003), Vargas (2007), and Gracia (2008, ch. 7).

4. In connection with the general receptivity to Marxism in Latin America, it may be worth noting that until his assassination, Leon Trotsky (1879–1940) spent the bulk of his exile from the Soviet Union in Mexico, where he was welcomed by the then-president Lázaro Cárdenas.

5. For a collection of early analytic work in Latin America, see Gracia et al. (1984).

6. See, for example, the English-language collection of critical essays on Dussel's work edited by Alcoff and Mendieta (2003).

7. A lengthier discussion of twentieth century Latin American philosophy would include, for example, work on philosophical anthropology and value theory.

8. For recent discussions of the history of Latin American philosophical work on race and identity, see Vargas (2004), von Vacano (2011), and many of the essays in Gracia (2011). For work concerned with contemporary, U.S.-focused issues concerning Latino/Hispanic identity, see Alcoff (2006) and Gracia (2000, 2007, and 2008).