The Effect on EQI of Partitioning the Outcome Space More Finely—Including Proof of the Nonnegativity of EQI

Given some experiment or observation (or series of them) c, is there any special advantage to parsing the space of possible outcomes O into more alternatives rather than fewer alternatives? Couldn't we do as well at evidentially evaluating hypotheses by parsing the space of outcomes into just a few alternatives—e.g., one possible outcome that h_i says is very likely and h_j says is rather unlikely, one that h_i says is rather unlikely and h_j says is very likely, and perhaps a third outcome on which h_i and h_j pretty much agree? The answer is “No !”. Parsing the space of outcomes into a larger number of empirically distinct possible outcomes always provides a better measure of evidential support.

To see this intuitively, suppose some outcome description o can be parsed into two distinct outcome descriptions, o₁ and o₂, where o is equivalent to (o₁∨o₂), and suppose that h_i differs from h_j much more on the likelihood of o₁ than on the likelihood of o₂. Then, intuitively, when o is found to be true, whichever of the more precise descriptions, o₁ or o₂, is true should make a difference as to how strong the comparative support for the two hypotheses turns out to be. Reporting whichever of o₁ or o₂ occurs will be more informative than simply reporting o. That is, if the outcome of the experiment is only described as o, relevant information is lost.

It turns out that EQI measures how well possible outcomes can distinguish between hypotheses in a way that reflects the intuition that a finer partition of the possible outcomes is more informative. The numerical value of EQI is always made larger by parsing the outcome space more finely, provided that the likelihoods for outcomes in the finer parsing differ at least a bit from some of the likelihoods for outcomes of the less refined parsing. This is important for our main convergence result because in that theorem we want the average value of EQI for the whole sequence of experiments and observations to be positive, and the larger the better.

The following Partition Theorem implies the Nonnegativity of EQI result as well. It show that each EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b] must be non-negative; and it will be positive just in case for at least one possible outcome o_ku, P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k]  ≠  P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k]. This theorem will also show that EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j |b] generally becomes larger whenever the outcome space is partitioned more finely. It follows immediately that the average value of EQI for a sequence of experiments or observations, EQI[cⁿ | h_i/h_j | b], averaged over the sequence of observations cⁿ, is non-negative, and must be positive if for even one of the c_k that contribute to it, at least one possible outcome o_ku distinguishes between the two hypotheses by making P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k]  ≠  P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k].

Partition Theorem:
For any positive real numbers r₁, r₂, s₁, s₂:

(1) if r₁/s₁ > (r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂), then
  (r₁+r₂)×log[(r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂)] < r₁×log[r₁/s₁] + r₂×log[r₂/s₂];

and

(2) if r₁/s₁ = (r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂), then
  r₁×log[r₁/s₁] + r₂×log[r₂/s₂] = (r₁+r₂)×log[(r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂)].

To prove this theorem first notice that

r1/s1 = (r1+r2)/(s1+s2)	iff	r1s1 + r1s2 = s1r1 + s1r2
	iff	r1/s1 = r2/s2.

We'll draw on this little result immediately below. It is clearly relevant to the antecedent of case (2) of the theorem we want to prove.

We establish case (2) first. Suppose the antecedent of case (2) holds. Then, from the little result just proved, we have

r₁ log[r₁/s₁] + r₂ log[r₂/s₂]

=	r1 log[(r1+r2)/(s1+s2)] + r2 log[(r1+r2)/(s1+s2)]
=	(r1 + r2) log[(r1+r2)/(s1+s2)].

That establishes case (2).

To get case (1), consider the following function of p:

f(p) = p log[p/u] + (1−p) log[(1−p)/v],
where we only assume that u > 0, v > 0, and 0 < p < 1.

This function has its minimum value when p = u/(u+v). (This is easily verified by setting the derivative of f(p) with respect to p equal to 0 to find the minimum value of f(p); and it is easy to verified that this is a minimum rather than a maximum value.) At this minimum, where p = u/(u+v), we have

f(p)	=	−u/(u+v) log[u+v] − v/(u+v) log[u+v]
	=	−log[u+v].

Thus, for all values of p other than u/(u+v),

−log[u+v]	<	f(p)
	=	p log[p/u] + (1−p) log[(1−p)/v].

That is, if p ≠ u/(u+v), −log[u+v] < p log[p/u] + (1−p) log[(1−p)/v].

Now, let p = r₁/(r₁+r₂), let u = s₁/(r₁+r₂), and let v = s₂/(r₁+r₂). Plugging into the previous formula, and multiplying both sides by (r₁+r₂), we get:

 if
  r₁/(r₁+r₂) ≠ s₁/(s₁+s₂) (i.e., equivalently, if r₁/s₁ ≠ (r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂)),
 then
  log[(r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂)] < [r₁/(r₁+r₂)] log[r₁/s₁] + (1−[r₁/(r₁+r₂)]) log[r₂/s₂]
  (i.e. equivalently, (r₁+r₂) log[(r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂)] < r₁ log[r₁/s₁] + r₂ log[r₂/s₂]).

Thus, from the two equivalents, we've proved case 2:
 if
  r₁/s₁ ≠ (r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂)),
 then
  (r₁+r₂) log[(r₁+r₂)/(s₁+s₂)] < r₁ log[r₁/s₁] + r₂ log[r₂/s₂]).

This completes the proof of the theorem.

To apply this result to EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b] recall that

EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b]

=	∑{u: P[oku | hj·b·ck] > 0} log[P[oku | hi·b·ck]/P[oku | hj·b·ck]]              ×P[oku | hi·b·ck].

Suppose c_k has m alternative outcomes o_ku on which both

P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] > 0  and  P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] > 0.

Let's label their likelihoods relative to h_i (i.e., their likelihoods P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k]) as r₁, r₂, …, r_m. And let's label their likelihoods relative to h_j as s₁, s₂, …, s_m. In terms of this notation,

EQI[ck | hi/hj | b]

=

m ∑ u = 1

ru×log[ru/su].

Notice also that (r₁+r₂+r₃+…+r_m) = 1 and (s₁+s₂+s₃+…+s_m) = 1.

Now, think of EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b] as generated by applying the theorem in successive steps:

0	=	1× log[1/1]
	=	(r1+r2+r3+…+rm)×log[(r 1+r2+r3+…+rm)/(s1+s 2+s3+…+sm)]
	≤	r1×log[r1/s1] + (r2+r3+…+rm)× log[(r2+r3+…+rm)/(s2+s 3+…+sm)]
	≤	r1×log[r1/s1] + r2×log[r2/s2] + (r3+…+rm)×log[(r3+…+rm)/(s 3+…+sm)]
	≤	…
	≤	m ∑ u = 1 ru×log[ru/su]
	=	EQI[ck | hi/hj | b].

The theorem also says that at each step equality holds just in case

r_u/s_u = (r_u+r_u+1+…+r_m)/(s_u+s_u+1+…+s _m),

which itself holds just in case

r_u/s_u = (r_u+1+…+r_m)/(s_u+1+…+s_m).

So,

EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b] = 0

just in case

1	=	(r1+r2+r3+…+rm)/(s1+s 2+s3+…+sm)
	=	r1/s1
	=	(r2+r3+…+rm)/(s2+s3+…+s m)
	=	r2/s2
	=	(r3+…+rm)/(s3+…+sm)
	=	r3/s3
	=	…
	=	rm/sm.

That is,

EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j  | b] = 0

just in case for all o_ku such that P[o_ku | h_j·b] > 0 and P[o_ku | h_i·b] > 0,

P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k]/P[o_ku | h_j·b·c _k] = 1.

Otherwise,

EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b] > 0;

and for each successive step in partitioning the outcome space to generate EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b], if

r_u/s_u  ≠   (r_u+r_u+1+…+r_m)/(s_u+s_u+1+…+s_m),

we have the strict inequality:

(r_u+r_u+1+…+r_m) × log[(r_u+r_u+1+…+r_m)/(s_u+s _u+1+…+s_m)] <
  r_u×log[r_u/s_u] + (r_u+1+…+r_m)×log[(r_u+1+…+r_m)/(s_u+1+…+s_m)].

So each such division of (o_ku∨o_ku+1∨…∨o_km) into two separate tatements, o_ku and (o_ku+1∨…∨o_km), adds a strictly positive contribution to the size of EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b]  just when  P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k] / P[o_ku | h_j·b·c _k]   ≠   P[(o_ku+1∨…∨o_km) | h_i·b·c_k] / P[(o_ku+1∨…∨o_km) | h_j·b·c _k].

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