Notes to Non-monotonic Logic

1. Note though that in some formalisms some input may be treated in a defeasible way so that Reflexivity need not hold. For instance, in corrective approaches such as the Free Consequences contradictory premises are not consequences.

2. We speak about super-arguments in the intuitive sense that e.g., A1 → … → An is a super-argument of A1 → … → Am where m < n.

3. Some pioneering systems in this tradition are the OSCAR system (Pollock (1995)), Defeasible Logic (Nute (1994)), or the formalisms in (Simari and Loui (1992)) and (Verheij (1996)). More recent work includes Dung et al. (2009) or Prakken (2012).

4. In this and the following examples we suppose that ⊤ is an arbitrary tautology and the formulas θ, τ, etc. appearing in the default rules are contingent (neither they nor their negations are tautologies).

5. One may think about a classical model M as follows: M is uniquely characterized by an assignment v of the truth-values 0 and 1 to the logical atoms. Whether a formula φ holds in M (in signs, M ⊧ φ) can then be determined recursively on the basis of v by means of the classical truth tables for ¬, ∧, etc.

6. We show one direction. Suppose max[φ] ⊧ ψ. Hence, since big-stepped probabilities are used, P({max[φ]}) > ∑{P({M}) ∣ M ≺ max[φ]} ≥ P([φ∧¬ψ]) = ∑{P({M}) ∣ M ∈ [φ∧¬ψ]}. Since max[φ] ⊧ ψ also P([φ∧ψ]) ≥ P({max[φ]}) and hence P([φ∧ψ]) > P([φ∧¬ψ]) which implies P(ψ∣φ) > ½.

7. For instance, “We thus argue that human rationality, and the coherence of human thought, is defined not by logic, but by probability.” (emphasis added, Oaksford and Chater (2009), p. 69)

Copyright © 2016 by
Christian Strasser <Christian.Strasser@ruhr-uni-bochum.de>
G. Aldo Antonelli

This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Please note that some links may no longer be functional.
[an error occurred while processing the directive]