Michael Oakeshott

First published Tue Mar 8, 2016

Michael Oakeshott (1901–1990) is commonly viewed as a conservative thinker and critic of government planning. But that view notices only one aspect of Oakeshott’s thought and invites misunderstanding because his ideas about government are not the conventional ones this characterization suggests. His ideas spring not from practical engagement but from study of the history of European political thought, sharpened by philosophical reflection on its arguments and their presuppositions. Like many other philosophers, Oakeshott saw philosophical questions as connected and as inviting wide-ranging critical investigations. His contribution to philosophy is therefore not limited to politics. It lies in distinguishing modes of understanding and inquiry, identifying different conceptions of rationality and their place in practical judgment, distinguishing the idea of the state as an association in terms of noninstrumental laws from that of the state as a corporate enterprise, and theorizing the character of history as a mode of inquiry and its place in explaining human conduct. Oakeshott also wrote on the history of political thought, especially the thought of Thomas Hobbes, as well as on religion, morals, education, aesthetics, and the character of political discourse. A recurrent theme in his writings is the tension between individuality, which implies plurality, and its denial, which he characterized as barbarism. Given his concern with individual freedom and his doubts about regarding politics as the pursuit of political ideals, the current interest of political philosophers in republican ideas of freedom as nondomination and in realism in political discourse as an alternative to political moralism suggests the continuing relevance of Oakeshott’s arguments. Rather than surveying all of these topics, this entry will focus on his most important contributions to philosophy: his theory of modes of experience, his criticism of political rationalism, his argument that the key tension in modern politics is over the character and purpose of the state, and his philosophy of history.

1. Life and Works

Michael Oakeshott’s father, Joseph Oakeshott, was a member of the Fabian Society, a socialist but not radical organization (its symbol was the tortoise), many of whose members participated in establishing the British Labor Party. The Society’s leaders, Beatrice and Sidney Webb, were also among the founders of the London School of Economics. The younger Oakeshott studied history in Gonville and Caius College, Cambridge, in the early 1920s and was made a fellow of the college in 1925. After serving in the British Army between 1940 and 1945 he returned to Cambridge, then taught briefly at Oxford before being appointed in 1951 as Professor of Political Science at the London School of Economics. He chaired his department there until his retirement in 1969. At some point during his years at the LSE he began an annual course of undergraduate lectures in the history of political thought. Initially focused on the classics of political thought, perhaps like his lectures at Harvard in 1958 (Oakeshott 1993b), the course eventually morphed into a more comprehensive consideration of the political thought and political experience of four peoples, those of ancient Greece, Rome, medieval Europe, and modern Europe (Oakeshott 2006). He also established a seminar in the history of political thought for postgraduate students and, as emeritus professor, continued to be active in it until 1980, contributing papers on the historical study of political thought and the philosophy of history. Brief accounts of Oakeshott’s life and career can be found in two memorial collections (Norman 1993; Marsh 2001) and a more recent biographical essay (Grant 2012).

Although Oakeshott challenged the postwar Labor government’s faith in planning, in his youth he thought of himself as a socialist. But it was socialism of a romantic sort, concerned with spiritual transformation rather than economic redistribution (O’Sullivan 2014). And though he subsequently repudiated Fabianism, Marxism, and other left-wing ideologies, Oakeshott sympathized with the anarchism of Pierre-Joseph Proudhon, sharing the latter’s vision of a liberal order combining community and equality with individuality and independence. His reputation as a conservative thinker was substantially shaped by essays on the limits of reason in political life, collected as Rationalism in Politics and Other Essays (cited as RP), on the basis of which he has been compared to a host of figures from Burke to Wittgenstein, while others have argued that he is better characterized as a liberal (Franco 1990). As a theorist of the rule of law he invites comparison with Friedrich Hayek and Carl Schmitt (Dyzenhaus and Poole 2015). But efforts to label Oakeshott’s thought as either conservative or liberal, Right or Left, founder not only on the ambiguities of those words but on his thoughtful rejection of the partisanship they imply: as he provocatively told the American conservatives to whom he gave a lecture on “Talking Politics” at the twentieth-anniversary celebration of the National Review in 1975, their differences with liberals were a petty squabble over how the spoils of the state as a corporate enterprise were to be distributed (RP 459). To grasp the philosophical significance of Oakeshott’s thought one must move beyond the labels and arguments of twentieth-century political controversy (Nardin 2015).

In his first book, Experience and Its Modes (1933, cited as EM), Oakeshott barely mentions politics. But this does not mean that he was not interested in political philosophy at that time, and in fact the book grew out a set of Cambridge lectures from the late 1920s, “The Philosophical Approach to Politics”, now included in Early Political Writings (Oakeshott 2010). But whereas in these lectures he distinguishes alternative ways of thinking about politics, in the book they are detached from the subject of politics and presented as general modes of experience. By the time he wrote Experience and Its Modes, Oakeshott had come to believe that political philosophy was necessarily defective, that it was not genuine philosophy and had no place in a philosophical work. The book is a highly individual performance in the style of British philosophical Idealism, written at a time when that approach to philosophy was going out of fashion. In it, Oakeshott credits the influence of Hegel, Bradley, and Bosanquet but it was evident that he had absorbed their views “into an insistent literary personality which moved freely and suggestively in many types of literature” (Cowling 2003: 256). When Oakeshott took up politics again, it was in the context of the controversies of the day, as illustrated by the anthology of texts he compiled in the late 1930s expounding the “doctrines” of contemporary Europe: Representative Democracy, Catholicism, Communism, Fascism, and National Socialism (Oakeshott 1939). His first postwar publication was an edition of Hobbes’s Leviathan, with an influential introduction later collected with other essays in Hobbes on Civil Association (Oakeshott 1975b). In 1947 he founded and began editing the Cambridge Journal as a vehicle for treating politics and culture as topics for civilized conversation rather than ideological polemics or academic research. Several of the essays reprinted in Rationalism in Politics made their first appearance in the journal.

Oakeshott’s magnum opus, On Human Conduct (1975a, cited as OHC) appeared late in his career. It was greeted in some quarters with incomprehension and in others by hostility, but mostly with silence. Even those who judged the book to be an important work found its style forbidding, and its impact has been muted. Also difficult are the essays on the philosophy of history collected in On History and Other Essays (1983, cited as OH). His essays on the idea of liberal education and its practical implications, collected in The Voice of Liberal Learning (1989, cited as VLL), are more accessible and continue to invite attention (Williams 2007; Backhurst and Fairfield 2016). After Oakeshott’s death other writings began to surface, some of which appeared in a series of volumes published by Yale University Press (Oakeshott 1993a, 1993b, and 1996) and others in a more recent series from Imprint Academic (Oakeshott 2004, 2006, 2007, 2008, 2010, and 2014). There has also been a steady stream of secondary works, including two companion volumes (Franco and Marsh 2012; Podoksik 2012), and this literature, together with the attention his less accessible writings are starting to receive, suggests that Oakeshott occupies an increasingly secure place in the history of philosophy and political thought.

2. Modes of Experience

Philosophers have used the word “mode” to refer to an attribute or form that a thing or substance can take, and sometimes to refer to an aspect of something larger (more inclusive) or more real than itself (Descartes 1641: 27–28, 31). For Oakeshott, who began as a philosophical Idealist critical of empiricism as an approach to philosophy, that thing or substance is experience as already shaped by the ideas brought to it by a thinking subject. Experience always involves thinking and therefore ideas. This claim that there is no experience unmediated by thought applies as much to sensation and perception as to intuition or inference. Where ideas have achieved a substantial degree of integrity, coherence, and differentiation, a mode of thought can be said to have emerged. In Experience and Its Modes there are traces of the view, also discernible in Spinoza and Hegel, that this “larger thing” is everything that exists, the sum total of experience identified as God or the Absolute. Oakeshott does not use the word “mode” in later writings in a way that postulates a universal or ultimate reality. But neither does he understand a mode of thought to be any kind of thinking or point of view. It is an “autonomous” kind of understanding or inquiry, one that is “specifiable in terms of exact conditions” and “logically incapable of denying or confirming the conclusions of any other mode of understanding” (OH 2). Because experience always involves ideas, a mode can be said to constitute a world of ideas, a distinct and self-consistent “whole of interlocking meanings” (VLL 38) resting on its own criteria of truth, factuality, and reality. Thinking that leads to action is one such mode, which Oakeshott called “practice”. Another is “history”, by which he meant not “the notional grand total of all that has ever happened” or some part of it, whose makers are the participants in the occurrences that constitute it, but rather a kind of enquiry into and understanding of such occurrences and therefore as something made by the historian (OH 1–2). It is, moreover, as Oakeshott devotes many pages to arguing, an inquiry that aims to explain past events as intelligible outcomes of antecedent events. In contrast to history, understood in this way, the mode of “science” is defined by its search for regularities that can account for the occurrence of repeatable events and for ways to express these regularities as relationships between quantities. Both history and science are inherently explanatory, however, which means that history is sharply distinguished from ideas about the past shaped by current practical concerns (the “practical past”) and science from the practical application of scientific ideas: for Oakeshott, engineering is a practical discipline rather than a scientific one.

Modes, then, are provisionally coherent and distinguishable kinds or categories of understanding and inquiry. In Experience and Its Modes, Oakeshott aims to identify the presuppositions in terms of which a mode can be made coherent and distinguished from other modes. In philosophy, categorial distinctions are distinctions of kind rather than degree and what are called categories are often thought of as the most fundamental classes to which things can belong. But philosophers differ on whether the identified kinds are natural or real (ontological) or conceptual (epistemological). The former are categories of being (Aristotle), the latter categories of understanding (Kant). Philosophers also disagree about whether a categorial scheme must be exhaustive and fixed or, alternatively, can be open and mutable. The modes that Oakeshott identifies in Experience and Its Modes—history, science, and practice, to which he later added “poetry” (art)—are epistemological categories, not ontological ones. And although the modes are mutually exclusive, they do not form a closed set. They are constructions that have emerged over time in human experience. They could change or even disappear and other modes might yet appear.

A number of conclusions follow from these premises. First, a mode of experience implies a distinct and autonomous kind of understanding and way of expressing that understanding in language. It implies a universe of discourse with its own arguments and ways of assessing and grounding them. Because propositions in one kind of discourse have no standing in another, truth is coherence within a given mode (Nardin 2001: 23–27). To argue across a modal boundary is to commit the fallacy of ignoratio elenchi (irrelevance). If there is any relationship at all between the modes it can only be conversational, not argumentative: cross-modal encounters yield differences, not agreed supra-modal conclusions. Oakeshott sometimes makes this point by speaking of modes as “voices” in an inter-modal conversation (RP 488–491, 497). Second, because what is rational in discourse depends on the mode of discourse, there is no mode-independent definition of reason or rationality. The illusion that there is arises from privileging what counts as reasonable within a given mode and believing that it is superior to other ways of thinking. This illusion of superiority generates the kind of hubris characteristic of each mode: historicism, scientism, pragmatism, aestheticism. A conversational as opposed to argumentative juxtaposition of modal voices is playful and for that reason inherently civilized, which means that to insist on the primacy of any one mode or voice is boorish, even barbaric. And third, because the modes are independent of one another, and none is more expressive of reality than any other, there can be no hierarchy of modes.

In making these points, Oakeshott differed from philosophical Idealists in Germany, Italy, and England who were exploring similar categorial distinctions around the same time. These included Benedetto Croce, who distinguished the theoretical modes of art, history, and philosophy from the practical modes of economics and ethics, and R.G. Collingwood, who in Speculum Mentis, an early work, began with Hegel’s triad of art, religion, and philosophy, identifying philosophy broadly defined with “knowledge” and distinguishing three kinds of knowledge—science, history, and philosophy proper—to generate a fivefold hierarchy of modes. In Collingwood’s scheme, art was at the bottom followed by religion, the former concerned to imagine or “suppose” and the latter to “assert”, and then by the three kinds of genuine knowledge, which are distinguished from art and religion in being critical. Philosophy is the most critical of all because it aims to transcend and synthesize the other forms (Collingwood 1924; Connelly 2015). Oakeshott, working in part from Collingwood, folded art and religion into practice, denied that modes could be ordered hierarchically, and defined philosophy as the activity of interrogating modal presuppositions rather than as itself a mode. But he severed the tie between philosophy and unqualified knowledge—“the Absolute”—that was part of much Idealist metaphysics from Hegel to Collingwood. The distinction between modal thinking and philosophy reappeared in On Human Conduct as a distinction between “conditional” and “unconditional” theorizing, the former resting on assumptions that the latter is concerned to question.

The idea of a hierarchy of modes is not particular to Idealism. Where there are different understandings, it can occur to someone interested in reconciling them to imagine that they represent different levels of understanding. In contrast to unifying philosophies, including philosophical Idealism, Oakeshott’s position is pluralist and anti-hierarchical. In this respect he has more in common with Wilhelm Dilthey, who struggled with the issue of relativity in metaphysics and how to distinguish the human from the natural sciences, than with the British Idealists—Bradley, Bosanquet, and McTaggart among others—with whom he is often associated (Boucher 2012). For Oakeshott, all knowledge is tentative and conditional. Theorizing is “an engagement of arrivals and departures” in which “the notion of an unconditional or definitive understanding may hover in the background, but … has no part in the adventure” (OHC 2–3). In attempting to construct a coherent view of the world the philosopher “puts out to sea” (OHC 40) and is perpetually en voyage: there are no “final solutions” in philosophy any more than in practical affairs.

3. Rationality and Rationalism

The illusion that there are “correct” answers to practical questions Oakeshott called “Rationalism”. It is the belief that practical activity is rational only when it rests on moral or causal laws whose truth can be demonstrated. In Marxism, for example, one encounters the claim that laws of historical change can be discerned scientifically and that practical guidance can be derived from them. But this claim, Oakeshott thought, should be understood as a rhetorical one that presupposes a certain kind of audience: it can be persuasive only for those who already believe that such laws exist and that they dictate correct decisions (Oakeshott 2008: 168–177). The error of Rationalism is to think that making decisions simply requires skill in the technique of applying rules or calculating consequences. In an early essay on this theme, Oakeshott distinguishes between “technical” and “traditional” knowledge. Technical knowledge is of facts or rules that can be easily learned and applied, even by those who are without experience or lack the relevant skills. Traditional knowledge, in contrast, means “knowing how” rather than “knowing that” (Ryle 1949). It is acquired by engaging in an activity and involves judgment in handling facts or rules (RP 12–17). The point is not that rules cannot be “applied” but rather that using them skillfully or prudently means going beyond the instructions they provide.

Political deliberation occurs when a public decision needs to be made and a proposed course of action defended against alternatives. But deciding which course of action to pursue involves more than simply applying rules or calculating costs and benefits. It requires interpretation and judgment. We must decide which rule to use and then interpret what it means in the situation to which it is applied. If, alternatively, we choose an action based on its likely consequences, we must judge the expected value of those consequences, which involves making value judgments as well as estimating probabilities. And whether we are applying rules or calculating outcomes, we must work with what we presume to be facts though these are always uncertain in various ways. For all these reasons, there is never a single and demonstrably correct course of action. Political arguments cannot be proved or disproved; they can only be shown to be more or less convincing than other such arguments. Political discourse, Oakeshott concludes, is a discourse of contingencies and conjectures, not of certainties or context-independent truths. It is characteristically persuasive and rhetorical, not a matter of demonstration or proof (RP 70–95; Nardin 2012).

These are familiar points, made by Oakeshott with particular clarity. What he adds to other philosophical discussions of practical reasoning, such as Aristotle’s treatment of techne and phronēsis (Nichomachean Ethics 1142a) or Kant’s remarks on judgment as the middle term between rules and applications (Kant 1793, 8:275), is an account of how practical, and in particular political, discourse is corrupted when these distinctions are overlooked. His conclusions rest on a detailed dissection of ideological politics, which, Oakeshott thought, reflects a characteristically modern disposition to substitute rules for judgment in practical reasoning. These rules, which are thought to govern practice and which can be moral, historical, scientific, or divine, are in fact not independent of practical activity but abstracted from it. The rules that we abstract from a practice and appear to govern it are “abridgments” of something more complex and nuanced. They are not independent of practical activity and do not in fact govern it (RP 121). They are, to borrow language from Michael Walzer, interpretations rather than discoveries or inventions (Walzer 1987). And what they interpret are ways of doing things—customs, habits, traditions, and skills:

the pedigree of every political ideology shows it to be the creature, not of premeditation in advance of political activity, but of meditation upon a manner of politics. (RP 51)

The Rationalist, unaware of the local origins of the universal principles he thinks he has identified, disparages knowledge gained through experience and rejects it in favor of something called reason. Whether deductive or computational, this abstract reason is thought to guarantee a degree of certainty that experience and judgment cannot provide. The fallacy of Rationalism, in other words, is that the knowledge it identifies as rational is itself the product of experience and judgment. It consists of rules, methods, or techniques abstracted from practice, tools that, far from being substitutes for experience and judgment, cannot be effectively used in the absence of experience and judgment.

Oakeshott discusses many examples of ideological politics in his essays on Rationalism. He dissects the rhetorical strategies of Locke, Bentham, and Marx and takes contemporaries to task for thinking that political conclusions can be extracted from religious or scientific principles or from the lessons of history. In his Lectures in the History of Political Thought (Oakeshott 2006, Lecture 31) and the last part of On Human Conduct (OHC 263–316), he discusses the arguments of Francis Bacon, the German Cameralists, and others who impute a collective purpose to the state as an enterprise for promoting some particular substantive goal. Depending on the thinker, this goal might be religious, economic, imperial, or therapeutic. Bacon emerges as an prominent figure in articulating the view that the purpose of government is to exploit nature, which implies mobilizing labor for the sake of collective prosperity or welfare—an implication fully explored and developed by subsequent thinkers, often but not only those identified as socialist (the “collective” and “welfare” elements of this view of the modern state are characteristically socialist, but the theme of exploiting nature is ubiquitous). Oakeshott examines seventeenth-century Puritanism, eighteenth-century enlightened despotism, and twentieth-century totalitarianism, all of which view the state as a corporate enterprise of one kind or another, instances of what he sometimes calls “teleocracy”. Like Hannah Arendt, he underlines the importance of European imperialism in nurturing new forms of despotism (Arendt 1951).

Oakeshott pushed his explorations of ideological politics in two directions. The aim of the first was to distinguish alternative understandings of the modern European state. The aim of the second was to affirm the autonomy of explanatory theorizing and its independence from practical engagement by criticizing the view that the two are inextricably related: the so-called “unity of theory and practice”. This is actually an argument, such as one finds in American pragmatism or in Heidegger and Gadamer, for the practical character of all knowledge (Neill 2013). Oakeshott’s targets include the arguments not only of practitioners of ideological politics but also those of critical theorists and moral philosophers who identify their activity as providing practical guidance under the label of normative or applied ethics. One such argument is that because politics is a practical activity, political philosophy is also practical. It aims primarily to judge and guide politics and only secondarily and instrumentally to understand it. Because the understanding it seeks is for the sake of judgment and action, political philosophy is intrinsically prescriptive or norm-setting.

Oakeshott challenged this view of political philosophy as inherently practical. Not only is it possible to distinguish political philosophy from its object, politics, but its claim to being philosophical requires that it be so distinguished. He makes the same point about moral philosophy. Normative ethics, he argued early on, is “pseudo-philosophy” (EM 331–346). Just as a theory of jokes is not itself a joke (OHC 10), a theory of morality is not itself a morality. Moral and political theorizing, Oakeshott thought, aims to understand, not to prescribe. The object of theorizing is a “going-on” to be reflected upon (“theorized”) by an observer (a “theorist”) whose reflections may generate a conclusion (a “theorem”) (Oakeshott 2004: 391; OHC 3). Theorizing is here distinguished from what Oakeshott calls “doing” in that the product of theorizing is an understanding, typically formulated as a theorem or proposition, in contrast to doing, in relation to which whatever reflection takes place assumes the form of deliberation designed to yield an action. Theorizing, which can occur in the modes of history and science as well as in philosophy, is not prescriptive but explanatory. What distinguishes philosophical from historical or scientific inquiry is that it is more critical in examining the presuppositions of inquiry: where the scientist or historian wants to get on with an inquiry, the philosopher is concerned—as Arendt also observes—to examine the experience of thinking itself, which is not an activity confined to professionals and which professionalism as well as the lack of it can at times obstruct (EM 7; OHC 1–12; Arendt 1971: 427). Political philosophy is properly philosophical when it questions the presuppositions underlying those aspects of practical activity that are called political.

An objection to distinguishing theory and practice in this way is that it treats as categorial a distinction that is better understood as one of degree. Political theory is messy. In any actual inquiry, theorizing and prescribing will be mixed together and it is not always clear where one begins and the other ends. They are certainly joined in Oakeshott’s writings (Haddock 2005). But the objection affirms rather than denies the distinction. This is not to say that the distinction between theorizing and doing cannot be challenged, but to push the discussion further the challenge must redefine the terms involved, for example by defining practical reasoning as reasoning that results in changes in belief and not only actions (Wallace 2014). Alternatively, one might treat the theory-practice distinction as contextual: a philosopher’s theoretical argument can look practical to a historian whose concern is to explain it in relation to a debate in which the philosopher was engaged.

For Oakeshott, philosophy is distinguished from other kinds of thinking, and especially from practical thinking, by its commitment to questioning rather than using the kinds of knowledge they privilege. Theorizing politics is therefore not the same as engaging in it, and to the extent that theorizing is itself political it fails as theorizing. The distinctive contribution of political philosophy, for Oakeshott, is not to generate ideologies or recommend policies but to understand political activity and ideas. The understandings it generates, moreover, are always provisional. Others may use these understandings to explain what is going on or to recommend a response to it, but to the philosopher, qua philosopher, they are material for further reflection. Although this might seem to blur the distinction between philosophy and other kinds of inquiry, Oakeshott preserves that distinction by identifying philosophy as an inquiry that is characteristically more relentless in questioning presuppositions than other inquiries: an inquiry

in which questions are asked not in order to be answered but so that they may themselves be interrogated with respect to their conditions. (OHC 11)

To embrace this enterprise is to escape the prison of one’s current understanding. For the philosopher, it is to leave politics and even political philosophy behind to pursue other inquiries. This view is not a description of what political philosophers are doing (they do many things) nor a prescription for how they should proceed; it is the product of Oakeshott’s reflections on his own experience in moving from engaging with political arguments to uncovering their presuppositions.

4. Civil Association

For the study of politics to be genuinely philosophical, Oakeshott thought, it must exchange the vocabulary of political controversy for one that allows it to explain politics in terms that differ from those that need to be explained. The two vocabularies are not interchangeable, however, which leads to misunderstanding. The philosopher, to borrow Plato’s metaphor, has left the cave and, should he return, saying strange things, he will not be understood and is likely to offend when he questions the beliefs of the cave-dwellers (Plato, Republic Book 6, 514a.2–515a.7; OHC 27–31). The need to escape the prison of an inherited political vocabulary explains why, in On Human Conduct especially, Oakeshott departs from that vocabulary to capture the character of the mode of association he calls “civil” and to contrast it with the idea of the state as an association to promote a substantive purpose: a corporate enterprise. Civil association implies a state whose laws leave citizens free to pursue their own self-chosen goals within limits that secure that freedom for all: a state that is premised on the independence of those associated and is therefore hostile to the domination that occurs when one person seeks to arbitrarily impose his preferences on others or when the state itself is organized to impose a collective purpose on everyone. Oakeshott’s Latinate terminology—civitas for state, cives for citizens, lex for law, jus for the rightness of law, and respublica for the common good—springs from his wish to direct the reader away from the conventional connotations of the English words by using words that are both less familiar and less contaminated by the concerns of enterprise association that pervade modern politics and therefore modern political discourse. Civitas is a mode of association in which cives are related to one another as fellow subjects of a common law, and in which the laws on which their relationship is based are noninstrumental rules.

A common objection to this view of the state is that any actual state must rest on instrumental as well as noninstrumental rules; no state can proceed without issuing orders and framing policies to secure compliance, to raise revenue, to defend itself against internal and external enemies, and so forth. Oakeshott would not disagree. Any actual state is a mixture of formal and substantive elements, procedures and policies, of civil and enterprise association. What he is doing, philosophically, is not describing the features of any actual state but rather identifying the “postulates” of civil association as a mode of association: those aspects of the state that define its civil character and distinguish it from states in which that character is recessive or even suppressed, as it is in despotic states. Cives are united in their recognition of the authority of lex and of the obligations it prescribes. The law identified as lex constrains citizens in the same way that Hobbes said hedges constrain travellers: they keep them on the roads without prescribing their destinations (Leviathan, ch. 30). To say that the laws in a civitas are authoritative is to say that their authority as law is independent of whether cives approve or disapprove of the obligations they prescribe. Similarly, to consider the desirability of an existing or proposed law in a civil association is to engage in an activity narrowly focused on the question of whether that law is an appropriate expression of respublica, understood not as a common substantive good, interest, or purpose but as the rules, procedures, offices, and related practices and arrangements governing the conduct of the associates (OHC 147–149).

Oakeshott considers the implications of this conception of the modern state in On Human Conduct, the essay on “The Rule of Law”, and other works. Underlying the theory of civil association he develops in these writings is a distinction between two modes of human relationship, one moral and the other prudential. Laws in the mode of civil association, which is an idea abstracted from what might be going on in an actual state, are noninstrumental rules of individual coexistence, the coexistence of independent wills, and not instruments to advance a collective purpose. Such laws can therefore be characterized as “moral”, in the sense of being authoritative constraints on how individuals go about satisfying their wants, rather than as prudential, that is, as instruments for achieving satisfactions. Cives are related on the basis of rules rather than wants. In contrast to persons related in transactions or in cooperation to procure individual or joint satisfactions, persons related morally (in this deontological sense of the term) are related on the basis of rules as rules: noninstrumental standards of conduct whose authority is distinguished from their utility. One might question Oakeshott’s use of the word “moral” without disagreeing with his suggestion that there is a distinction between the propriety of an act as judged by its relationship to a rule and its consequential desirability. A moral rule binds people regardless of their purposes; it binds enemies as well as friends. As a moral relationship, civil association unites people not as comrades pursuing a shared goal but as individuals pursuing goals of their own, subject to the constraints of a common law that is not itself the instrument of some larger purpose.

Lex is what Oakeshott calls an “ideal character”, an abstraction that must not be confused with the law of any existing state. To theorize civil association is not to describe the contingent features of a particular state but to identify its presuppositions as a distinguishable kind of legal order. Having identified the modes of civil and enterprise association, Oakeshott is in a position to distinguish a legal order organized to advance a substantive purpose, whose laws are instrumental to that enterprise, from a legal order that is without any such purpose, the laws of which are noninstrumental constraints on the choices of subjects pursuing purposes of their own. Once this is understood, we can see why he identifies the rule of law with civil association: the point of distinguishing a kind of legal order identified as the rule of law is precisely to distinguish between laws premised on the independence of citizens from those designed to conscript them for purposes not their own and thus to dominate them. For Oakeshott, the rule of law is a concept, not a description of any actual legal order, much less a guiding ideal or ideology (as it is for a less philosophical legal thinker like Friedrich Hayek). In what is sometimes called “the ambiguity thesis” (Friedman 1989), Oakeshott holds that any actual state—any actual legal order—is mixture of noninstrumental rules regulating interactions among citizens and rules instrumental to achieving substantive purposes, that is, an ambiguous combination of civil and enterprise association.

Even in states where the civil character predominates there will be enterprise elements as well. To affect the conduct of the associates in an actual state, there must not only be rules of association but also procedures for recognizing, altering, and applying those rules. Civil association, in other words, requires legislative and judicial institutions as well as an apparatus of “ruling” (policing, taxing, conscripting, etc.). Such institutions are required to anchor the idea of civility in the real world. The rule of law needs judges and legislators if it is to subsist in an actual state. The government of an actual state will occupy buildings, keep records, employ administrators, and collect taxes, and manage other material instruments of governing. As part of the practical engagement of governing it will sometimes pursue substantive policies, seek to produce particular outcomes, issue specific orders or commands, and concern itself not only with classes of persons but named individuals. It must make arrests, issue injunctions, and even in emergencies impose martial law. All these powers can be, and often are, misused and corrupted, but the powers themselves must be available if the rule of law is to be more than “a logician’s dream” (OH 149). Nevertheless, in civil association the persona of the legislator, judge, or administrator is defined by the obligations of lex. In the mode of civil association, the persona of the legislator is not that of an advocate of policies. A judge is not an arbitrator between interests nor is an administrator (ruler) the manager of a purposive project. What is to be legislated, adjudicated, and enforced is noninstrumental law, lex, not laws that are instruments for promoting the policies of the state conceived as a corporate enterprise. In any actual state these personas—legislator and policy-maker, judge and arbitrator, ruler and manager—may not be sharply distinguished. But in the mode of civil association, the ideas of legislative and executive authority are distinct and justice is blind.

There is a tension, then, between the conceptual presuppositions of the rule of law or civil association—in Oakeshott’s thought the two are synonymous—and the conditions for realizing it in the contingent circumstances of a particular state. A related tension is that between the authority of laws and their desirability, for a legal order that most of its subjects disapproved of might have difficulty sustaining itself. But the tension is conceptual and not only practical. Oakeshott joins other theorists who are sometimes labeled legal positivists in distinguishing the validity of a law as law (which he calls its “authenticity”) from its desirability or justice (“rightness”). But as the vocabulary he has chosen signals, there are subtle differences he wants the reader to keep in mind. In a state understood as a civil association, a law is authentic if it is the outcome of an authoritative procedure for enacting or otherwise recognizing it as belonging to a given legal order, which leaves open the question of its utility, moral legitimacy, justice in the sense of meeting some standard of fair distribution, or other qualities that might be thought to bear on its desirability. For Oakeshott, the rightness of a law (strictly speaking, the jus of lex) is not a matter of its consequences. He does not agree with John Rawls, Ronald Dworkin, and other liberal egalitarians that the rightness of a law (which they call justice) depends on whether it fairly distributes benefits and burdens (OH 156). Nor does he agree that it depends on criteria that Lon Fuller (1969) calls the “inner morality” of law, which requires among other things that laws be public, general, and prospective rather than retroactive. These are, he argues qualities not of justice but of legality—a law that is secret, tailored to affect particular named individuals, or regulating acts done before it had been enacted are disguised commands, not genuine rules (OHC 128). Oakeshott also disagrees with those who think that the justice of a law depends on its conformity with a higher law, either divine or natural, with principles of human rights, or with any other universal and categorical standard (OHC 174; OH 142). But he does not accept the positivist argument that the justice of a law is the same as its validity. To make that argument, he thinks, is to confuse justice with authority by taking the law itself as providing criteria for assessing its own justice.

Oakeshott is clearer about what justice in civil association is not than about what it is. He suggests that the most important consideration in assessing the justice of a law is whether the obligations it prescribes are appropriately imposed by law, in part because law is inherently coercive (OHC 160; OH 143). That an action is harmful, wrong, or otherwise undesirable is not necessarily a decisive reason to forbid it legally. Whether a state should constrain someone’s choices on such grounds depends on what Oakeshott calls the moral-legal self-understanding of a community (OH 160). If the criteria used in judging the justice of laws are not already embedded in the way that a community deliberates legal changes, what is called justice can become an arbitrary standard that undermines the rule of law. The defect here is that of “Rationalism”, judging the laws of a community according to abstract criteria unrelated to the self-understandings of its members. His view resembles that of Michael Walzer, who argues that appropriate and effective “social criticism” comes from those who are experienced in the ways of the community they criticize: they are “connected critics” who based their criticism on the community’s own standards: who stand “a little to the side, but not outside” the communities whose practices they criticize (Walzer 1987: 61). The desirability or otherwise of a law, then, must be judged in relation to the practices of the community (its “traditions”, in his earlier vocabulary) and to the vocabulary commonly used in debating limits on individual conduct. Deliberating the jus of lex calls for a disciplined focus on the obligations that it is proper for a state to prescribe, and among these is certainly the consideration that it should not impose on citizens substantive purposes that are not their own. But a law might also be found undesirable if enforcing it requires intrusive surveillance of the sort that might, for example, be thought necessary to suppress terrorism. The character of deliberation in a state understood to be a civil association is defined by its style more than its conclusions in particular cases (OH 161).

Oakeshott’s idea of civil association is a response to a fundamental question in political philosophy: how can the nonvoluntary character of law be reconciled with individual freedom? And his answer, which perspicuously restates conclusions reached by Rousseau, Kant, Mill, and others, is that law can respect individual freedom only when it is understood as limited to regulating the interactions of citizens pursuing purposes of their own. To have a legal order of this kind requires coercion to ensure adequate compliance with its laws, but coercion for that purpose must be distinguished from coercion designed to advance substantive policies unrelated to maintaining the civil order itself. When law becomes an instrument for imposing the purposes of some on others who do not share them, law as a framework for coexistence among free individuals gives way to tyranny. The legal subject in an enterprise state is not an independent citizen but someone to be led, managed, mobilized, and provided for: a subordinate assigned a role in a purposive enterprise. It must not be forgotten that the distinction here is a conceptual one: Oakeshott is distinguishing two modes of associations and the understanding of law that goes with each, not describing any particular state or denying that different states combine civil and enterprise elements in different proportions. The dependent role-player in an enterprise state and the independent individual in a civil one are equally “free”, in one sense of that term, because both have “agency”, the capacity to choose even when their choices are constrained. But only in civil association do those associated enjoy “individual freedom”, which for Oakeshott means freedom from being legally subjected to the arbitrary choices of others.

This is a version of the republican idea of freedom as independence or nondomination (Skinner 1998; Pettit 1997), though for Oakeshott as for Kant this freedom is defined in moral rather than material terms and stripped of certain other elements of republican political thought, such as that people must have a hand in making the laws that govern them. Individual freedom, which is distinct from the freedom inherent in agency, is not compromised by law in civil association. One reason for this is that law in civil association, as a mode of association, consists of general laws, not substantive commands (Coats 1992: 104). From the standpoint of a concern for individual freedom, the problem with the state as an enterprise association is that it cannot accommodate purposes that are “eccentric or indifferent to its purpose” and is for that reason inherently as well as contingently compulsory (OHC 316). Participating in a purposive enterprise can express individuality only if it is freely chosen. The subjects of an enterprise state are not free because the purposes they are compelled to serve have been chosen for them. And though some may contingently escape, whether they are permitted to go (or for that matter to remain) is a management decision (OHC 317). To be subject to the laws of a state understood as an enterprise association is therefore to participate in a collective project that is not one’s own. Because individual freedom in purposive association is the freedom to dissociate as well as to associate, it can exist only if the association is voluntary, and this cannot be the case if the association is a state.

Oakeshott develops his account of civil association in the second part of On Human Conduct. In the first part of that book, he explores the presuppositions on which it rests—the ideas of agency, agents, actions, transactions for the satisfaction of wants, instrumental and noninstrumental practices, and the “human conduct” of agents related in terms of such transactions and practices. And in the third and final part he explores ideas about the character of the modern state in European political practice and philosophy since the late Middle Ages, a topic he also considers in other writings (Oakeshott 1993b, 1996, 2006, 2008). He traces the distinction between civil and enterprise association to the medieval ideas of societas and universitas, terms that he adapts (and reconstructs) for his purpose. Societas designates a relationship of agents in a practice (such as a common language)

joined not in seeking a common substantive satisfaction, but in virtue of their understanding and acknowledgement of the conditions of the practice concerned and of the relationships it entails. (OHC 88)

A universitas, in contrast, is a corporate undertaking (such as a partnership, guild, or school) established to achieve a particular end. Societas is not synonymous with civil association, however; it stands for a larger class of relationships in terms of the noninstrumental considerations that define them. The civil condition emerges only when these considerations harden into rules (“laws”) and are seen to require ways of recognizing, altering, and enforcing them. Reflection on the characteristics of the modern state, so conceived, appears in the writings of Machiavelli, Madison, Constant, and Montesquieu, among others, and more philosophically (that is, in terms of its presuppositions) in those of Bodin, Hobbes, Spinoza, Kant, Fichte, and Hegel. Paralleling these efforts are those of theorists of the state as a purposive enterprise. These include Francis Bacon, who theorized the state as a productive estate, Joseph de Maistre, who saw it as “a religious corporation in the Catholic idiom” (OHC 281), and various theorists of enlightened despotism, socialism, and national development. But Oakeshott’s discussion of these thinkers and doctrines is brief and only loosely historical, inviting the charge that he is using them for purposes of his own and in a way that falls short of his own standard of genuine historical inquiry.

5. History and the Human Sciences

By distinguishing thinking aimed at understanding and explaining from thinking aimed at deliberating and acting, Oakeshott sought to protect historical, scientific, and philosophical inquiry from the imperialism of practical concerns. This effort can be seen with particular clarity in his treatment of historical inquiry, especially in his concern to distinguish the idea of a distinctively historical past from what he called “the practical past”. Genuine historical inquiry is concerned with what happened, which is dead and cannot speak to present concerns, not with an imagined practical relevance implied in expressions such as “the lessons of history” (EM 316) or “the living past” (OH 19). Historical inquiry is explanatory, not an exercise in seeking guidance from past experience. It is not that experience cannot guide but that the guidance found is not “historical”. Nor is it the business of history to justify the present by telling a story about progress. Books about the progress of the human mind (Condorcet) or the end of history (Fukuyama) written from the standpoint of the author’s time offer not history but retrospective politics of the sort that Herbert Butterfield called “Whig history”, history designed to ratify, if not glorify, the present (Butterfield 1931). Oakeshott drew on the efforts of historians to distinguish an understanding of history that was detached from present concerns to create a theory of history as a distinct mode of inquiry and understanding. It is a theory, too, that makes historical explanation central to the study of human conduct.

Implicit in these claims for the autonomy and importance of historical inquiry is a distinction between scientific and interpretive approaches to understanding human affairs. Oakeshott uses the word “conduct” to identify intelligent choice and action, and contrasts it with behavior that can be explained as the outcome of natural, not-intelligent, processes. Such explanations, which have their place in understanding natural phenomena, are irrelevant to understanding human conduct as expressions of intelligence and therefore as involving ideas. Unlike the natural sciences, what are sometimes called the “human sciences” (Geisteswissenchaften, the sciences of mind as ideas or culture) are interpretive. They are, in fact, doubly interpretive because they interpret human conduct, which is itself an interpretive activity. And insofar as these disciplines move beyond interpreting human conduct to explaining particular acts, the explanations they provide are “historical” explanations.

In making these arguments Oakeshott draws on late nineteenth- and early twentieth-century German thinking about the study of history, and especially on the anti-positivism of Windelband, Rickert, and Dilthey. Their arguments rest on a distinction between the realm of human freedom and that of natural necessity advanced by Vico, Kant, and Hegel, among others. Understanding human conduct from the perspective of judgment and choice can be scientific—that is, systematic—in its own manner. Such inquiry may focus on what Hegel called “objective spirit”, shared ideas expressed in languages, moral traditions, and other practices that must be interpreted to be understood. But it can also concern itself with individual performances: particular acts, ideas, judgments, arguments, and other products of thinking. The human sciences, the disciplines of the humanities and humanistic social sciences, are concerned with the content of thinking—ideas—not the biochemical processes that make thinking possible (VLL 23–24).

If distinguishing the social sciences from the humanities was a mistake, Oakeshott thought, another mistake was to imagine that the word “social” designates a subject for investigation. Sociology, he argued, is not a discipline with its own subject matter; it is either coextensive with the social sciences or else the study of what remains when disciplines such as economics and psychology have claimed certain aspects of human activity as their own. But the study of a residual category cannot constitute a genuine discipline, nor is there any general science of society that grounds the conclusions of economics, psychology, and the other social sciences. What are loosely called social relationships are actually relationships in terms of specific practices—habits, customs, rules, and roles—that prescribe considerations of utility or propriety in acting. They are not, as Oakeshott thought sociologists were inclined to assume,

components of an unspecified, unconditional interdependence or “social” relationship, something called a “society” or “Society”. (VLL 24)

This is not a point about nomenclature but rather the argument that a proper discipline is one whose boundaries enable a coherent inquiry or set of inquiries. For Oakeshott, the category that defines a coherent set of inquiries is not “social” but “intelligent”. Intelligence, here, is not the quality of being bright or stupid but of having agency, the capacity to think and choose. An object excavated by an archaeologist is either a manifestation of intelligence (an inscribed tablet) or not (just another rock). The categories intelligent and not-intelligent are orders of inquiry within which more specific inquiries can be carried on. Intelligence is not an ontological category but an epistemological one. Oakeshott is not suggesting that the experienced world is made up of two kinds of things but rather that we experience the world differently according to the categories of understanding we bring to experience. And for that understanding to be coherent, it must respect the categorial distinction between the intelligent and the not-intelligent because these categories are mutually exclusive. Propositions that rest on one set of presuppositions cannot be combined with propositions resting on the other. Propositions about the biochemistry of thinking cannot explain the meaning of what a person is thinking. No inquiry, in short, can lead to a coherent body of knowledge if its objects are categorially ambiguous. This claim restates Oakeshott’s point that cross-modal arguments are necessarily incoherent. Much of what is called “social science” is undermined by efforts to understand intelligent conduct as the product of not-intelligent physiological, psychological, or social processes understood as “natural”, that is, as operating independently of understanding and choice. Such efforts cannot generate genuine knowledge because they involve a categorial error. Coherent explanation is impossible when

rules are misidentified as regularities, intelligent winks as physiological blinks, conduct as “behavior” and contingent relationships as causal or systematic connections. (VLL 26)

Thoughts and actions can be explained, but the way they are explained is historically, not scientifically. An argument, choice, or judgment made by a particular person at a particular moment is an individual performance, an event. Scientific psychology can generalize about how people are likely to act but it cannot explain particular choices, which may fail to illustrate those generalizations, much less the intellectual content of arguments or thoughts. And the reason for this limitation is not only the categorial impossibility of explaining the content of an idea in terms of statistical correlations or biochemical processes but the gap between an observed generalization and a particular act. The generalizations about human nature or social circumstances sought, tested, and relied upon by social scientists, though often illuminating, cannot explain individual acts, which as human conduct are always performances in relation to some practice or practices, and always involve ideas. The social sciences search for causal relationships between variables like age, income, occupation, or race, and they offer explanations in terms of these relationships rather than in terms of intelligent choice and action. Such explanations are possible, but what they explain is variance in the data, not particular performances. Explaining particulars, Oakeshott argues, is “historical” explanation, which as he understands it is categorially distinct from scientific explanation. An observed pattern in the data, a generalization, identifies a “type” of action. A performance, in contrast, is the choice of an actual agent in a particular place and moment—in the language of philosophy, it is a “token” (Wetzel 2014). Science as a generalizing mode of inquiry does not aim to explain individual events but rather the occurrence and causes of kinds of events. The humanities and humanistic social sciences are concerned with individual events or other individual objects. In some cases these objects are themselves types: the individual religion “Christianity” is a sub-type of the type “religion”. In other cases, the object is a token: the baptism of Delphine Picot in New Orleans on 7 April 1853 is an individual event, an instance of the type baptism. What makes a performance individual is the particular meaning it has, which is best explained in relation to antecedent events. For Oakeshott, only explanations of this kind are properly historical. We can go part way toward explaining a performance by interpreting it in relation to the practices it performs, but such an interpretation does little more than illuminate the type of conduct a particular performance illustrates. A performance is also one in a series of acts each of which has meaning in relation to acts that have come before it. These antecedent acts, or some of them, that illuminate its unique character.

Oakeshott’s account of historical explanation departs sharply from a positivist theory like the covering law model (Hempel 1942; Nagel 1961) because it holds that a historical explanation purports to explain not just the occurrence of an event but its significance. Unlike scientific explanations, which postulate the occurrence of repeatable events, historical explanations postulate events that are individual and unique. Positivist theories of historical explanation get things backward by assuming that the event to be explained is already understood (that it is an instance of a type of event), but the historian cannot make that assumption. Historical inquiry is not an exercise in explaining events whose character is known in advance of the effort to explain it. That character has yet to be established, and it can be established only by showing how events that the evidence indicates to be its antecedents led to it and not to some other individual event. The relationship between an antecedent event and a subsequent event is a “contingent” one in which the meaning (“character”) of the subsequent event is illuminated by the antecedent.

Oakeshott’s conclusion that history is central to the human sciences is the result of reflecting on the limitations of science in understanding ideas and practices, and in explaining the individual performances that illustrate those ideas and practices. But it is also the result of reflecting on the limits of interpretation in explaining individual performances. Scholars in the humanities and humanistic social sciences typically interpret such performances as expressing or reacting to a historical practices such as religious ceremonies, musical genres, culinary traditions, or legal procedures, which may be understood as “languages” of human performance. But the understanding thereby gained is incomplete, Oakeshott argues, because what it reveals is not the individuality of a performance but rather its “conventionality” (OHC 99–100). As explanation, interpretation is therefore always incomplete. It can help to understand contexts, situations, and types of action (practices) but cannot explain the occurrence of a particular act (performance): why a particular person did such and such a thing on this or that occasion.

Given his view of the importance of history among the human sciences, the attention that Oakeshott paid it over many decades is not surprising. History is the first mode that he considers in Experience and its Modes and he returned to the topic in most of his later books as well as in many book reviews and unpublished essays. History as a mode is not a record of past events but a distinct way of identifying and accounting for events, and the task of the philosophy of history, as Oakeshott sees it, is to clarify what makes historical inquiry distinct. Historical inquiry is above all constructive; it cannot simply record historical events because what is identified as an event depends on evidence, which must itself be winnowed. The point, fundamental to the modern discipline of critical history, was made in 1852 by Gustav Droysen, who argued that

the data for historical investigation are not past things, for these have disappeared, but things which are still present here and now, whether recollections of what was done, or remnants of things that have existed and of events that have occurred. (Droysen 1893: 11)

The historian begins not with the past itself, brute facts, but with survivals from the past that must be authenticated and interpreted before they can be used as evidence. Historical facts are conclusions; they are not “what really happened” but “what the evidence obliges us to believe” (EM 112), in the sense that we identify as historical fact the conclusions that our investigation best supports. The task of historical inquiry is to establish historical knowledge, according to the canons of the historian’s craft, from evidence that is always scattered, suspect, and open to being interpreted in different ways.

Historical knowledge, as Oakeshott sees it, can therefore be said to be constructed (Goldstein 1976; O’Sullivan 2006). The concepts (“identities”) that the historian uses to organize an inquiry—the Renaissance, China, just war theory—are designated, not discovered, and also changing, not immutable. Historical identities are interpretive tools that dissolve under scrutiny into collections of events. They are not a given but themselves open to historical reconsideration. The historian’s concern, then, is with a sequence of events that is itself a changing identity to be understood. Historical inquiry is the study of changes in identified events that are understood as outcomes of antecedent events and that are themselves changing identities. And historical explanation is illuminating the circumstantial meaning of events in relation to their antecedents, which in a genuinely historical inquiry are always events and never laws or processes. In a historical explanation, an event to be explained is made intelligible as the outcome of what the evidence leads the historian to conclude are relevant antecedent events. In this account of historical inquiry, which Oakeshott develops in the second essay in On History (OH 45–96), a particular historical past appears as a collection of contingently related events, often presented in a narrative. But not necessarily: Oakeshott argues against what was an emerging view at the time he was writing (Ankersmit 1983; see Danto 2007 for a later exposition of this view) because he insists that although historians frequently do construct narratives, the narrative form is merely one way of presenting historical knowledge (others include synchronic portraits or quantitative patterns).

If historical knowledge is a construction, it follows that what we identify as the past in fact belongs to the present because it is what the evidence supports within the present body of historical knowledge. Historical facts are present because all facts are present, that is, exist as conclusions within a present system of ideas. The historical past is constructed according to what present evidence—objects that have survived into the present, such as an axe, diary, painting, or coin, that are treated as evidence—compels the historian to believe. Nor is this constructed past the only possible past: if there is a historical past then there must be other, non-historical, pasts constructed in modes other than the historical mode (OH 9). Of these, Oakeshott is largely concerned with what he calls the practical past because of the difficulty of distinguishing it from a past constructed in historical inquiry:

even the most severely “historical” concern with the past is still liable to be compromised by seeking the answer to questions which are not historical questions and by asides and even judgments which belong to some other mode of understanding. (OH 118)

What is distinctive about Oakeshott’s conception of historical inquiry and explanation can be brought out by comparing it with R.G. Collingwood’s more familiar claim that the historian’s aim is to reenact the past (Collingwood 1993 [1946]: 282–302). That claim makes historical truth subjective by requiring that the historian reconstruct past events as they were experienced by those who participated in them. But this privileges the understandings of the participants, who may not have understood or even known what was happening, and it overlooks their differences with one another. Their ideas are important in reconstructing the past but are not themselves the whole of what we need to know to explain a historical event. To argue otherwise is to argue that the historian is barred from having any ideas about the past that “would have been impossible for anyone who lived in that past” (Oakeshott 2008: 49). Nor does Oakeshott agree with Collingwood’s claim that “all philosophy is the philosophy of history” (Collingwood 1993 [1926]: 425) because this would make philosophy, and by implication all knowledge, subservient to historical knowledge (Oakeshott 2007: 199). For Oakeshott, history is a mode of understanding, not a primordial form of human experience of which all other forms are modes. Collingwood’s argument for the primacy of history (historicism) is no less reductionist than arguments for the primacy of science (scientism) or practice (pragmatism). These and other arguments, which are based on the premise that a particular mode of understanding is the foundation of other kinds of understanding, characteristically assume the truth of what they set out to prove. Historical inquiry constructs knowledge from what in the mode of history counts as evidence. It does not provide knowledge of a given, pre-modal reality. Historical foundationalism postulates unmediated access to historical reality, but if historical pasts are intellectual constructions, there is no access to these pasts except through historical inquiry.

Bibliography

Works by Oakeshott

  • Oakeshott, M., 1933 [EM], Experience and Its Modes, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, (ed.), 1939, The Social and Political Doctrines of Contemporary Europe, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 1975a [OHC], On Human Conduct, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 1975b, Hobbes on Civil Association, Oxford: Basil Blackwell, reprinted 2000, Indianapolis: Liberty Fund.
  • –––, 1983 [OH], On History and Other Essays, Oxford: Basil Blackwell, reprinted 1999, Indianapolis: Liberty Fund.
  • –––, 1989 [VLL], The Voice of Liberal Learning, T. Fuller (ed.), New Haven: Yale University Press. Reprinted 2001, Indianapolis: Liberty Fund.
  • –––, 1991 [RP], Rationalism in Politics and Other Essays, New and Expanded Edition, T. Fuller (ed.), Indianapolis: Liberty Fund. Original edition 1962, London: Methuen.
  • –––, 1993a, Religion, Politics and the Moral Life, T. Fuller (ed.), New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • –––, 1993b, Morality and Politics in Modern Europe: The Harvard Lectures, S.R. Letwin (ed.), New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • –––, 1996, The Politics of Faith and the Politics of Scepticism, T. Fuller (ed.), New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • –––, 2004, What is History? and Other Essays, L. O’Sullivan (ed.), Exeter: Imprint Academic.
  • –––, 2006, Lectures in the History of Political Thought, T. Nardin and L. O’Sullivan (eds.), Exeter: Imprint Academic.
  • –––, 2007, The Concept of a Philosophical Jurisprudence: Essays and Reviews 1926–51, L. O’Sullivan (ed.), Exeter: Imprint Academic.
  • –––, 2008, The Vocabulary of a Modern European State, L. O’Sullivan (ed.), Exeter: Imprint Academic.
  • –––, 2010, Early Political Writings 1925–30, L. O’Sullivan (ed.), Exeter: Imprint Academic.
  • –––, 2014, Notebooks, 1922–86, L. O’Sullivan (ed.), Exeter: Imprint Academic.

Other Works

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  • Arendt, H., 1951, The Origins of Totalitarianism, New York: Schocken Books, 2004.
  • –––, 1971, “Thinking and Moral Considerations: A Lecture”, Social Research, 38(3): 417–446.
  • Aristotle, 4th Century BCE, The Nichomachean Ethics, D. Ross (trans.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1980.
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  • Connelly, J., 2015, “Accounting for Experience: The Differing Modes of R.G. Collingwood and Michael Oakeshott”, Michael Oakeshott Association Conference, University of Hull, September 17–19, 2015.
  • Cowling, M., 2003, Religion and Public Doctrine in Modern England, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Danto, A.C., 2007, Narration and Knowledge, New York: Columbia University Press.
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  • Droysen, J.G., 1893, Outline of the Principles of History, E.B. Andrews (trans.), Boston: Ginn & Co.
  • Dyzenhaus, D. and T. Poole (eds.), 2015, Law, Liberty and State: Oakeshott, Hayek and Schmitt on the Rule of Law, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Franco, P., 1990, “Michael Oakeshott as a Liberal Thinker”, Political Theory, 18(3): 411–436.
  • –––, 2004, Michael Oakeshott: An Introduction, New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • Franco, P. and L. Marsh (eds.), 2012, A Companion to Michael Oakeshott, University Park: The Pennsylvania State University Press.
  • Friedman, R., 1989, “Oakeshott on the Authority of Law”, Ratio Juris, 2(1): 27–40.
  • Fuller, L., 1969, The Morality of Law, New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • Goldstein, L.J., 1976, Historical Knowing, Austin: University of Texas Press.
  • Grant, R., 1990, Oakeshott, London: Claridge Press.
  • –––, 2012, “The Pursuit of Intimacy, or Rationalism in Love”, in Franco and Marsh 2012: 15–44
  • Haddock, B., 2005, “Contingency and Judgement in Oakeshott’s Political Thought”, European Journal of Political Theory, 4(1): 7–21.
  • Hempel, C., 1942, “The Function of General Laws in History”, Journal of Philosophy, 39(2): 35–48.
  • Kant, I., 1793, “ On the Common Saying: That May be Correct in Theory, but It is of No Use in Practice”, in Practical Philosophy, M.J. Gregor (trans.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996, 273–309.
  • Marsh, L. (ed.), 2001, Michael Oakeshott: Philosopher, London: Michael Oakeshott Association.
  • Nagel, E., 1961, The Structure of Science; Problems in the Logic of Scientific Explanation, New York: Harcourt Brace & World.
  • Nardin, T., 2001, The Philosophy of Michael Oakeshott, University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press.
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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

The author gratefully acknowledges Luke O’Sullivan’s scholarship and advice in writing this entry.

Copyright © 2016 by
Terry Nardin <tnardin@nus.edu.sg>

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