Notes to William of Ockham
1. For an account of Ockham's life, including a discussion of how these dates are calculated in Ockham's case, see Wood [1997], Chap. 1. For further details of Ockham's life, see Courtenay [1999].
2. Earlier biographies generally put the date in 1285, but scholars now put it later. The modern English spelling of the village's name is ‘Ockham’, although because of the distinguished prominence of several French medievalists early in the twentieth century, one still occasionally sees the spelling ‘Occam’. One also sometimes sees his name without the ‘of’, treating ‘Ockham’ as a surname rather than a place name. See, e.g., the title of Adams [1987].
3. By this time Latin was virtually no one's native language. Ockham's first language was probably Middle English or French. Latin was exclusively a second language that lived primarily in very specialized and artificial contexts: academic, ecclesiastical, legal, diplomatic. This fact suggests that it is probably wrong to look for “ordinary language” considerations in the Latin philosophical writings of this period, whether by Ockham or anyone else.
4. The technical term is ‘oblatus’ (“offered”); Ockham was an “oblate.” Although this perhaps sounds shocking to us, like giving away one's children, in fact the practice was quite common and amounted to little more than sending one's child to boarding school. Various religious schools would often take in children from the surrounding area, educate them, feed and house them. The children were not necessarily expected to pursue a religious vocation later in life, although many of them did. For families that were not especially wealthy, this practice was a good way to educate their children. Moreover, it offered the possibility of social mobility, since the Church was probably the only institution of the day where it was possible to advance on the basis of hard work and one's own native talent, regardless of social origins. (Even for wealthy families, the practice provided a good solution to the problem posed by primogeniture: what to do with the second son.)
5. Ockham's accuser may have been John Lutterell, who had been Chancellor at the University of Oxford for a while. Recall that the Papacy at this time, together with all the offices and bureaucracy that went with it, was not located in Rome, but at Avignon, a moderate-sized town in southeastern France, on the Rhone River. It was there between 1309 and 1377.
6. It is not certain that Ockham had ever actually been ordered to stay in Avignon. Michael of Cesena later on claimed that this was an utter fabrication (Wood [1997], p. 10 n. 21). Note that Ockham was excommunicated for his actions, not for his views.
7. With the possible exception of two short works on logic—Lesser Treatise on Logic (Tractatus minor logicae) and Primer of Logic (Elementarium logicae)—the authenticity of which has been questioned.
8. One still often sees it stated that Ockham died in 1349. But Gál [1982] convincingly establishes the correct date as 1347.
9. There are two doubtful exceptions, the Lesser Treatise on Logic and the Primer of Logic, which appear to be late and may not be authentic. See note 7 above.
10. A complete list of Ockham's works, with information on modern editions and English translations, can be found in Spade [1999], pp. 4-11. References below to the works will be made using the titles, abbreviations, internal divisions and other conventions specified in Spade [1999], xv-xvii. The Dialogue is being published in an on-line web edition and English translation by the British Academy, available at www.britac.ac.uk/pubs/dialogus/ockdial.html (in progress).
11. Ockham's treatment of insolubilia (paradoxes like the Liar Paradox), for instance, appears to be greatly inspired by Walter Burley (Spade [1974]), and his account of the semantics of relative pronouns as well as the machinery (although not the underlying semantics) of his theory of supposition are likewise derived from Burley (Brown [1972]). Important details of his theory of truth conditions for tensed and modal propositions likewise already appear in Burley, although this may reflect more a “British,” as distinct from a “Continental,” way of formulating these conditions (Spade [1980], section III, pp. 13-22).
12. For example, his theory of topical “middles” and their role in his theory of consequence. See Normore [1999], p. 46.
13. In medieval terminology, “hypothetical” propositions included more than conditionals. The distinction between categorical and hypothetical propositions is approximately the same as the modern distinction between atomic and molecular propositions—with one important difference: the negation of an atomic proposition is molecular, whereas the negation of a categorical proposition is still categorical, not hypothetical. A hypothetical proposition requires two or more categorical components.
14. Ockham's treatment of modal syllogistic is fuller and more complete than any of his predecessors', and is a significant achievement. See Normore [1999], p. 33.
15. This notion of signification is ultimately derived from Aristotle, On Interpretation 3, 16b19-21, and especially from Augustine, De doctrina christiana, II, 1.1.
16. See Spade [1975a] for a discussion of the implications of this.
17. This way of putting the matter suggests that Ockham sees no problem with referring to presently non-existing objects by means of demonstratives. But the secondary literature is not agreed on this. See Normore [1975] and Karger [1976].
18. These first approximations are not strictly correct, but will serve as a start. In fact, matters are greatly complicated by considerations that go beyond the scope of this article. For a discussion, see Spade [1975]. See also the discussion of mental language below.
19. This ignores a prior division Ockham and others make, between “proper” and “improper” supposition. Improper supposition is in effect metaphorical or figurative reference. Medieval semantics did not have a good theory of metaphor, so that this part of supposition theory remained undeveloped, by Ockham and others, beyond a few sketchy remarks. Ockham's three main kinds of supposition were not original, and were in fact fairly standard among medieval logicians, although his way of defining them reflects peculiarities of his own theory of signification. The origins of supposition theory are not yet well understood, although the terminology of “personal” supposition suggests that it had something to do with theological considerations about “person” vs. “nature” in Trinitarian and Christological theory.
20. Note that the subject of ‘Every dog is a mammal’ and of ‘Dog has three letters’ is (apart from the quantifier in the former) exactly the same term. Medieval logic did not have quotation mark conventions, which were not regularly used until after the invention of printing, and the theory of material supposition provided a substitute for them. But material supposition had other uses that cannot be easily handled by quotation marks. For example, in ‘It is possible for him to run’, according to Ockham and many other medieval logicians, the expression ‘for him to run’ has material supposition not for itself but for the proposition ‘He runs’ or ‘He is running’.
21. For details of these claims, see Spade [1988].
22. On the history of the idea of mental language up to the time of Ockham, see Panaccio [1999].
23. The respective role of causality and similarity with respect to natural signification in Ockham has been a somewhat controversial issue in recent secondary literature. See e.g. Adams [1987], Chap. 4, Panaccio [2004], Chap. 7, and [2015].
24. For details of the following discussion, see Spade [1975], Panaccio [1990] and [2004], Chap. 4-6.
25. For example, proper names of individuals and the names of the Aristotelian categories. The reasons for these exceptions need not detain us here.
26. This tells us that the real definitions of absolute terms will be complex connotative expressions.
27. This holds at any rate within mental language. In conventional languages, there can in principle be several variants of a given nominal definition insofar as a simple term can legitimately be substituted for a synonymous one within a spoken or written nominal definition. This, however, does not happen in mental language since there is no plurality of synonyms among simple concepts according to Ockham.
28. The phrase “endowed with” in the example must not be taken to refer to special things: it is what Ockham calls a ‘syncategorematic term’, the function of which is merely to connect in the right way the referring terms (or categorematic terms) with each others.
29. The case is made in detail in Panaccio [1990] and [2004], Chap. 4.
30. See on this Panaccio [2004], p. 86.
31. For interesting discussions of the history of “Ockham's Razor,” see Brampton [1964], and Maurer [1978] and [1984].
32. The story of this change of heart is told in Boehner [1946]. For a discussion of the reasons behind Ockham's change of heart, see Panaccio [2004], pp. 23-27.
33. For more on the theory of exposition and its relation to connotation theory, see Spade [1990], and Ashworth and Spade [1992].
34. For a detailed discussion of Ockham's procedure in a wide variety of cases, see Adams [1987], especially “Part One: Ontology” (pp. 3-313) and “Part Four: Natural Philosophy” (pp. 633-899).
35. For opposite viewpoints, contrast Adams [1987], Chap. 9 (pp. 287-313), and Spade [1998].
36. In addition to the Exposition and the Questions on Aristotle's Book of the Physics, cited earlier, Ockham wrote:
- Brief Summa of the Physics,
- Little Summa of Natural Philosophy,
plus occasional treatises:
- On the Eternity of the World (considered a problem of natural philosophy as well as of theology),
- On Final Causality,
- On the Mirror and Its Object,
- On the Agent Intellect and On the Possible Intellect according to Averroes. These were considered topics in natural philosophy,
- Treatise on Quantity and On the Body of Christ. These two works are about the Eucharist, but devote a great deal of discussion to the natural philosophy underlying the doctrine of the Eucharist, particularly questions about the category of quantity.
In addition, there is much material relevant to natural philosophy in the Quodlibets and in the Commentary on the Sentences.
37. Translated in Boehner [1990], Chap. 1. Ockham also treats this question in Sent. I, d. 2, q. 4, translated in Spade [1994], pp. 114-48, where he is arguing against Walter Burley, who explicitly held that one reason we need universals in our ontology is to make science (in the Aristotelian sense) possible.
38. With this section, and for much further detail on Ockham's physics, see Goddu [1984] and [1999].
39. ‘Species’ in this sense should not be confused with species as opposed to genus. In the present usage, ‘species’ means something like “appearance.” English preserves traces of this meaning in our term ‘specious’.
40. Stump [1999], p. 170.
41. That last step is the difficult one, and the one over the details of which medieval authors disagree the most. It goes without saying that many details of the epistemological story are omitted from this quick sketch.
42. E.g., Quodl. V.4. Note the use of Ockham's Razor.
43. E.g., Sent. II.13. On Ockham's rejection of the theory of species in intellectual cognition, see Panaccio [2004], pp. 27-31.
44. For a discussion, see Tachau [1988].
45. Sent. I, Prologue, q. 1. Translation by Spade.
46. For an excellent presentation of Ockham's theory of intuitive and abstractive cognition - with the convincing correction of a longstanding mistake about it - see Karger [1999]. Much has been written, on the other hand, about Ockham's distinctive thesis about the (supernatural) possibility of intuiting non-existing beings (in which case the relevant intuitive cognition would cause, he thinks, the true judgement that the intuited thing does not exist); see in particular Panaccio and Piché [2010].
47. This point is developed in McGrade [1999], in terms of what he calls “implicit divine command.”
48. The text is translated with an informative introduction and commentary in Wood [1997].
49. For a discussion of the issues in this passage, and for much else about Ockham's moral theory, see Adams [1986], Freppert [1988], Wood [1997], King [1999].
50. This remark needs to be carefully qualified, since Aquinas's moral psychology is very subtle. But this is not the place to do it.
51. See, e.g., Maurer [1962], pp. 285-86.
52. Duns Scotus allowed that we can choose not to act toward our ultimate good; but he did not think we can knowingly choose to act directly against it. For a discussion of Aquinas, Scotus, Ockham and others on these issues, see Adams [1999].
53. McGrade [1999] argues that this difference does not represent a real change of mind on Ockham's part, but instead only a shift of emphasis. See note 47 above.
54. Note that the Franciscan ideal of poverty did not imply that there was anything morally wrong with property, that property was evil, either individually or collectively. Poverty was not a duty but a “counsel of perfection.” That is, it is perfectly acceptable to own property, but it is better—more perfect—not to have any. St. Francis seems to have wanted his friars not just to do their duty, but to go beyond that and be perfect as far as possible. The issue was not, therefore, strictly a moral one.
55. Mollat [1963], p. 16.
56. This entire discussion of Ockham's political theory is greatly inspired by Kilcullen [1999].
