Challenges to Metaphysical Realism

According to metaphysical realism, the world is as it is independently of how humans or other inquiring agents take it to be. The objects the world contains, together with their properties and the relations they enter into, fix the world’s nature and these objects exist independently of our ability to discover they do. Unless this is so, metaphysical realists argue, none of our beliefs about our world could be objectively true since true beliefs tell us how things are and beliefs are objective when true or false independently of what anyone might think.

Many philosophers believe metaphysical realism is just plain common sense. Others believe it to be a direct implication of modern science, which paints humans as fallible creatures adrift in an inhospitable world not of their making. Nonetheless, metaphysical realism is controversial. Besides the analytic question of what it means to assert that objects exist independently of the mind, metaphysical realism also raises epistemological problems: how can we obtain knowledge of a mind-independent world? There are also prior semantic problems, such as how links are set up between our beliefs and the mind-independent states of affairs they allegedly represent. This is the Representation Problem.

Anti-realists deny the world is mind-independent. Believing the epistemological and semantic problems to be insoluble, they conclude realism must be false. In this entry I review a number of semantic and epistemological challenges to realism all based on the Representation Problem:

1. The Manifestation Argument: the cognitive and linguistic behaviour of an agent provides no evidence that realist mind/world links exist;
2. The Language Acquisition Argument: if such links were to exist language learning would be impossible;
3. The Brain-in-a-Vat Argument: realism entails both that we could be massively deluded (‘brains in a vat’) and that if we were we could not even form the belief that we were;
4. The Conceptual Relativity Argument: it is senseless to ask what the world contains independently of how we conceive of it, since the objects that exist depend on the conceptual scheme used to classify them;
5. The Model-Theoretic Argument: realists must either hold that an ideal theory passing every conceivable test could be false or that perfectly determinate terms like ‘cat’ are massively indeterminate, and both alternatives are absurd.

I proceed by first defining metaphysical realism, illustrating its distinctive mind-independence claim with some examples and distinguishing it from other doctrines with which it is often confused, in particular factualism. I then outline the Representation Problem in the course of presenting the anti-realist challenges to metaphysical realism that are based on it. I discuss metaphysical realist responses to these challenges, indicating how the debates have proceeded, suggesting various alternatives and countenancing anti-realist replies.

The aim throughout will be to see whether the realist can respond to the anti-realist challenges and so much of the subsequent discussion will be taken up with attempts to formulate realist replies to these challenges that have some initial credibility. However it needs to be noted that all these replies are provisional: anti-realism gains much of its force by highlighting a gap between realist metaphysics and epistemology that no one really knows how to bridge.

• 1. What is Metaphysical Realism?
• 2. Carnap and Mind-Independent Existence
• 3. Anti-Realist Challenges to Realism
  • 3.1 Language Use and Understanding
  • 3.2 Language Acquisition
  • 3.3 Radical Skepticism
  • 3.4 Conceptual Schemes and Pluralism
  • 3.5 Models and Reality
• 4. Metaphysical Realist Responses
  • 4.1 Language Use and Understanding
  • 4.2 Language Acquisition
  • 4.3 Radical Scepticism
  • 4.4 Conceptual Schemes and Pluralism
  • 4.5 Models and Reality
• 5. Summary
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. What is Metaphysical Realism?

Metaphysical realism is the thesis that the objects, properties and relations the world contains exist independently of our thoughts about them or our perceptions of them. Anti-realists either doubt or deny the existence of the entities the metaphysical realist believes in or else doubt or deny their independence from our conceptions of them.

Metaphysical realism is not the same as scientific realism. That the world’s constituents exist mind-independently does not entail that its constituents are as science portrays them. One could adopt an instrumentalist attitude toward the theoretical entities posited by science, continuing to believe that whatever entities the world actually does contain exist independently of our conceptions and perceptions of them.

Henceforth, we shall often just use the term ‘realism’ to mean metaphysical realism. Opposition to realism can take many forms so there is no single theoretical view denoted by the term ‘anti-realism’. One approach, popular in continental philosophy, is to reject realism in favour of the view that words can only acquire their meaning intra-linguistically, through their semantic relations with other words, rather than through any (fanciful) ‘referential’ relations to the world outside of language.

Within the ranks of analytic philosophy, verificationists and pragmatists also reject realism, though for different reasons. We shall focus in this entry on the types of criticism voiced by these two groups of analytic philosophers with Michael Dummett advocating verificationism and Hilary Putnam pragmatism. Both reject realism by deploying semantic considerations in arguments designed to show that realism is untenable. The goal of this entry is to outline these ‘semantic’ challenges to realism and to see whether they can be answered.

This characterization of realism in terms of mind-independence is not universally accepted. Some object that mind-independence is obscure. Others maintain that realism is committed, in addition, to a distinctive (and tendentious) conception of truth [Putnam 1981, 1985, 1992; Wright 1991] or, more radically, that realism just is a thesis about the nature of truth—that truth can transcend the possibility of verification, ruling statements for which we can gather no evidence one way or the other to be determinately either true or false. An example would be “Julius Caesar’s heart skipped a beat as he crossed the Rubicon.” Thus the realist on this view is one who believes the law of bivalence (every statement is either true or false) holds for all meaningful (non-vague) statements [Dummett 1978, 1991, 1993].

These semantic formulations of metaphysical realism are unacceptable to realists who are deflationists about truth, denying that truth is a substantive notion which can be used to characterise alternative metaphysical views [see the entry on the deflationary theory of truth]. Such realists tend to ignore the anti-realist’s semantic and epistemological challenges to their position.

It is a mistake to identify realism with factualism, the view that sentences in some discourse or theory are to be construed literally as fact-stating ones. The anti-realist views discussed below are factualist about discourse describing certain contentious domains. Adopting a non-factualist or error-theoretic interpretation of some domain of discourse commits one to anti-realism about its entities. Factualism is thus a necessary condition for realism. But it is not sufficient. Verificationists like Dummett reject the idea that something might exist without our being able to recognize its existence. They can be factualists about entities such as numbers and quarks while maintaining anti-realism about them since they deny that any entities can exist mind-independently.

2. Carnap and Mind-Independent Existence

Why do some find the notion of mind-independent existence inadequate for the task of formulating metaphysical realism? The most common complaint is that the notion is either obscure, or, more strongly, incoherent or cognitively meaningless. An eloquent spokesman for this strong view was Rudolf Carnap: “My friends and I have maintained the following theses,” Carnap announces [Carnap 1963, p.868]:

(1) The statement asserting the reality of the external world (realism) as well as its negation in various forms, e.g. solipsism and several forms of idealism, in the traditional controversy are pseudo-statements, i.e., devoid of cognitive content. (2) The same holds for the statements about the reality or irreality of other minds (3) and for the statements of the reality or irreality of abstract entities (realism of universals or Platonism, vs. nominalism).

In spite of his finding these disputes meaningless, Carnap indicates how he thinks we could reconstruct them (sic.) so as to make some sense of them: if we were to “replace the ontological theses about the reality or irreality of certain entities, theses which we regard as pseudo-theses, by proposals or decisions concerning the use of certain languages. Thus realism is replaced by the practical decision to use the reistic language”.

Carnap does not have in mind a factualist reformulation of metaphysical realism here—his “reistic” language is strictly limited to the description of “intersubjectively observable, spatio-temporally localized things or events”.

What matters for our purposes is not Carnap’s sense of a commensurability between a metaphysical thesis about reality and a practical decision to speak only about observable things, but rather that he thinks he can explain how the illusion of meaningfulness arises for the metaphysical theses he declares “devoid of cognitive content”.

His explanation has to do with a distinction between two types of questions: internal and external questions. By way of illustration Carnap shows how the distinction works in the controversy over the existence of abstract entities:

An existential statement which asserts that there are entities of a specified kind can be formulated as a simple existential statement in a language containing variables for these entities. I have called existential statements of this kind, formulated within a given language, internal existential statements. [Carnap 1963, p. 871]

Carnap contends that

Just because internal statements are usually analytic and trivial, we may presume that the theses involved in the traditional philosophical controversies are not meant as internal statements, but rather as external existential statements; they purport to assert the existence of entities of the kind in question not merely within a given language, but, so to speak, before a language has been constructed. [1963, p. 871]

Declaring all such external existential questions devoid of cognitive content, Carnap now feels emboldened to dismiss both realism that asserts the ontological reality of abstract entities and nominalism that asserts their irreality as “pseudo-statements if they claim to be theoretical statements” (ibid).

More importantly, Carnap has hit upon an explanation for the persistent allure of the notion of mind-independent reality: we often wish to know whether some existence claim is true. Provided we realize existence claims can only be properly formulated and evaluated within a language \(L\) our query is perfectly reasonable and can very often be answered by examining the specification of the domain of \(L\)’s quantifiers. Thus, to use Carnap’s own example, suppose a theorist wishes to know for a language \(L'\) whose domain contains material objects, classes of objects and classes of classes of objects, the answer to the following existential question:

• (1) Does there exist an \(x\) and a \(y\) such that \(x\) is an element of an element of \(y\)?

Carnap maintains (ibid) that an affirmative answer to this question is both true and provable in \(L'\) (though he does not specify any theory expressible in \(L'\) in which (1) is derivable).

But suppose that instead of \(L'\), our theorist had asked the same question of another language \(L''\) the universe of discourse for which contained material objects and classes of these but no classes of classes of them. Then the following universal statement would now be provable in \(L''\), Carnap claims (again without specifying any theory expressible in \(L''\) for which this might hold), as well as true in that language:

• (2) For every \(x\) and \(y\), \(x\) is not an element of an element of \(y\)

Suppose our theorist, Al let’s call him, though initially attracted to \(L'\) for its superior expressive and deductive power when compared to \(L''\), now starts to have misgivings about the content and consistency of some of its existential assertions. After deliberating he decides:

• (3) There are classes of objects.

But he also accepts:

• (4) There are no classes of classes of objects.

This brings him into conflict with his good friend Bob. For Bob believes not only in classes of objects but also in classes of classes of objects and thus endorses \(L'\) as a language best suited to represent his ontological beliefs. That is, like Al, Bob believes (3), but Bob also accepts (5):

• (5) There are classes of classes of objects.

Is there a genuine dispute between Al and Bob? Is there a fact of the matter as to who is right, whose ontological views reflect the way the world is really structured? Carnap says “No”: seeking to elevate the modal status of their linguistic decisions from mere preferences for one language over another to unconditional obligations to reflect how reality is independently of any representaton, Al and Bob have temporarily lost sight of the particular linguistic contexts that give meaning to the existential claims they respectively advanced at (4) and (5). All that can be meaningfully said, according to Carnap, is that whilst (4) is true in \(L''\) it is false in \(L'\) and, conversely, whilst (5) is true in \(L'\), it is false in \(L''\). The cognitive content of (5) for Bob is given by (1) and that of (4) for Al by (2). As Carnap puts it:

Thus we see the difference between (them) is not a difference in theoretical beliefs [DK: as Bob seems to think when he makes the pseudo-assertion at (5)]; it is merely a practical difference in preferences and decisions concerning the acceptance of languages. [loc. cit., p. 873]

This is a beguiling story but it does not do what Carnap wishes it to do: it does not spirit away all troubling metaphysical questions about mind-independent existence by parlaying them into (or replacing them with) sanitized questions about the entities the quantifiers range over in this or that language. Here’s why. Consider the following case. Suppose the year is 1928, the year Carnap published his Aufbau. A mathematician, Cass, working in classical mathematics (sometimes shortened to “CM”), comes across the following question:

• (Q) Are there irrational numbers \(a\) and \(b\) such that \(a^b\) is rational?

Cass realizes at once that she can answer this question, reasoning from premise (A):

• (A) Either \(\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}\) is rational or it is irrational.

The reasoning continues:

Suppose this number \(\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}\) is rational. Then since \(\sqrt{2}\) is irrational, our problem is solved by taking \(a = \sqrt{2}, b = \sqrt{2}\). Suppose alternatively that \(\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}\) is irrational. Then that very irrational number raised to the power \(\sqrt{2}\) must be rational. For this number is equivalent to \(\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2} \times \sqrt{2}}\) which is just the rational number 2. So in this latter case, by selecting \(a = \sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}, b = \sqrt{2}\) we ensure that we have selected two irrational numbers \(a\), \(b\) such that \(a^b\) is rational.

Whence, we have a solution to our problem:

• (C) Either \(a = \sqrt{2}\), \(b = \sqrt{2}\) or else \(a = \sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}\), \(b = \sqrt{2}\) are two irrational numbers \(a\), \(b\) such that \(a^b\) is rational.

Now as the background logic for CM is classical there is nothing wrong with Cass’s reasoning proceeding, as it does, from an instance of the classically valid Law of Excluded Middle at (A). It is an example of a “non-constructive” existence proof: demonstrating that one or another alternative must hold without providing a means for ascertaining which one does hold.

Suppose now we ask Cass which of the two statements below is true in classical mathematics:

1. \(\sqrt{2}\) is an irrational number such that \(\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}\) is a rational number.
2. \(\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}\) and \(\sqrt{2}\) are irrational numbers such that \((\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}})^{\sqrt{2}}\) is a rational number.

Cass, working in 1928, believes one or the other of these statements must be true in classical mathematics but she has no means for determining which is true. So she cannot answer our question. Further, let us suppose that no one ever does find a method for determining which alternative holds good.

Aside: As it turns out (and this is the reason for indexing the example to a particular time) this last supposition is contrary to fact. In 1934 Gelfond and Schneider independently proved that if \(a, b\) are algebraic numbers with \(a \ne 0\) or \(1\) and \(b\) not rational then any value of \(a^b\) [\(= \exp(b \log a)\)] is a transcendental number. The Gelfond-Schneider Theorem answered in the affirmative David Hilbert’s Seventh Problem: whether \(2^{\sqrt{2}}\) is transcendental. It also follows that \(\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}\) is irrational so that (II) is true-in-CM.

Now even though she lacks any method for deciding which alternative holds, according to Cass either (i) is true-in-CM or else (ii) is true-in-CM. But if so, Cass in 1928 has an instance of a mind-independent existence claim holding of an internal existence statement: one of these two pairs of numbers \((a, b)\) in question, either \((a=\sqrt{2}, b=\sqrt{2})\) or else \((a=\sqrt{2}^{\sqrt{2}}, b=\sqrt{2})\) is such that \(a\) and \(b\) are both irrational but \(a^b\) is rational even though we may never be able to determine which pair of numbers it is (and we could have been in Cass’s situation today had the Gelfond-Schneider Theorem lain forever undiscovered).

But what should Carnap say about this case? He cannot protest that Cass’s assertion that one or other element of the sentence pair {i), (ii)} is true-in-CM is a pseudo-statement as he did for Bob’s assertion (5) that there are classes of classes of objects. For the statement that either (i) is true-in-CM or else (ii) is true-in-CM is an internal statement and thus, by Carnap’s lights, a statement that has cognitive content.

Hence, one cannot undermine the notion of mind-independent reality in the simple way Carnap imagines, namely, by the internal/external distinction coupled with the claim that external statements are pseudo-statements. For, whatever its other virtues, the internal/external distinction cannot explain why someone should believe that exactly one of (i) or (ii) has to be true in a certain language even though we might never be in a position to determine which. And this is precisely what the belief in mind-independent reality amounts to.

3. The Anti-Realist Challenges to Metaphysical Realism

3.1 Language Use and Understanding

The first anti-realist challenge to consider focuses on the use we make of our words and sentences. The challenge is simply this: what aspect of our linguistic use could provide the necessary evidence for the realist’s correlation between sentences and mind-independent states of affairs? Which aspects of our semantic behaviour manifest our grasp of these correlations, assuming they do hold?

For your representations of the world to be reliable, there must be a correlation between these representations and the states of affairs they portray. So the cosmologist who utters the statement “the entropy of the Big Bang was remarkably low” has uttered a truth if and only if the entropy of the Big Bang was remarkably low.

A natural question to ask is how the correlation between the statement and the mind-independent state of affairs which makes it true is supposed to be set up. One suggestive answer is that the link is effected by the use speakers make of their words, the statements they endorse and the statements they dissent from, the rationalizations they provide for their actions and so forth; cognitively, it will be the functional role of mental symbols in thought, perception and language learning etc. that effects these links.

When we look at how speakers actually do use their sentences, anti-realists claim, we see them responding not to states of affairs that they cannot in general detect but rather to agreed upon conditions for asserting these sentences. Scientists assert “the entropy of the Big Bang was remarkably low” because they all concur that the conditions justifying this assertion have been met.

What prompts us to use our sentences in the way that we do are the public justification conditions associated with those sentences, justification conditions forged in linguistic practices which imbue these sentences with meaning.

The realist believes we are able to mentally represent mind-independent states of affairs. But what of cases where everything that we know about the world leaves it unsettled whether the relevant state of affairs obtains? Did Socrates sneeze in his sleep the night before he took the hemlock or did he not? How could we possibly find out? Yet realists hold that the sentence “Socrates sneezed in his sleep the night before he took the hemlock” will be true if Socrates did sneeze then and false if he did not and that this is a significant semantic fact.

The Manifestation challenge to realism is to isolate some feature of the use agents make of their words, or their mental symbols, which forges the link between mind-independent states of affairs and the thoughts and sentences that represent them. Nothing in the thinker’s linguistic behaviour, according to the anti-realist, provides evidence that this link has been forged—linguistic use is keyed to public assertibility conditions, not undetectable truth-conditions. In those cases, such as the Socrates one, where we cannot find out whether the truth-condition is satisfied or not, it is simply gratuitous to believe that there is anything we can think or say or do which could provide evidence that the link has been set up in the first place. So the anti-realist claims [Dummett 1978, 1991, 1993 Tennant 1997; Wright 1993].

Why should we expect the evidence to be behavioural rather than, say, neurophysiological? The reason anti-realists give is that the meanings of our words and (derivatively for them) the contents of our thoughts are essentially communicable and thus must be open for all speakers and thinkers to see [Dummett 1978, 1993].

3.2 Language Acquisition

The second challenge to be considered concerns our acquisition of language. The challenge to realism is to explain how a child could come to know the meanings of certain sentences within his/her language: the ones which the realist contends have undetectable truth-makers associated with them. How could the child learn the meanings of such sentences if these meanings are determined by states of affairs not even competent speakers can detect?

Consider the sentence (S) once more:

• (S) Socrates sneezed in his sleep the night before he took the hemlock.

Realists say (S) is either true or false even though we may (and almost certainly will) never know which it is. The state of affairs which satisfies (S)’s truth-condition when it is true, its ‘truthmaker’, and the state of affairs which satisfies the truth-condition of the negation of (S) when (S) is false are supposed to be able to hold even though competent speakers cannot detect whether they do. How could the child ever learn about this undetectable relation?

Suppose God (or nature) had linked our mental representations to just the right states of affairs in the way required by the realist. If so, this is a semantically significant fact. Anyone learning their native language would have to grasp these correspondences between sentences and states of affairs. How can they do this if even the competent speakers whom they seek to emulate cannot detect when these correspondences hold? In short, competence in one’s language would be impossible to acquire if realism were true [Dummett 1978, 1993; Wright 1993]. This is the Language Acquisition challenge.

This challenge is exacerbated by the anti-realist’s assumption that since the linguistic meaning of an expression \(E\) is determined solely by competent speakers’ use of \(E\) the child’s task in all cases is to infer the meaning of \(E\) from its use. Thus Dummett [1978 pp. 216–217], in discussing the meaning of mathematical statements, proposes a thesis he argues holds for the meanings of every kind of statement:

The meaning of a mathematical statement determines and is exhaustively determined by its use. The meaning of a mathematical statement cannot be, or contain as an ingredient, anything which is not manifest in the use made of it, lying solely in the mind of the individual who apprehends that meaning: if two individual agree completely about the use to be made of the statement, then they agree about its meaning. The reason is that the meaning of a statement consists solely in its role as an instrument of communication between individuals, just as the powers of a chess-piece consist solely in its role in the game according to the rules.

W.V.O. Quine is even more insistent on the public nature of linguistic meaning. Displaying his unshakable faith in Skinnerian models of language-learning he writes [1992, pp. 37–38]:

In psychology one may or may not be a behaviourist, but in linguistics one has no choice … There is nothing in linguistic meaning beyond what is to be gleaned from overt behaviour in observable circumstances.

3.3 Radical Skepticism

According to Hilary Putnam, the metaphysical realist subscribes not just to the belief in a mind-independent world but also to the thesis that truth consists in a correspondence relation between words (or mental symbols) and things in that mind-independent world. Call this thesis correspondence truth (after Devitt 1991). More importantly, metaphysical realists aver that an ideal theory of the world could be radically false, Putnam contends: ‘radical’ in the sense that all (or almost all) of the theory’s theses could fail to hold. Such a global failure would result if we were to be ‘brains-in-a-vat’ our brains manipulated by mad scientists (or machines, as in the movie The Matrix) so as to dream of an external world that we mistake for reality. Call this thesis radical skepticism.

It is widely believed that states of affairs that are truly mind-independent do engender radical skepticism. The skeptic contends that for all we could tell we could be brains in a vat—brains kept alive in a bath of nutrients by mad alien scientists. All our thoughts, all our experience, all that passed for science would be systematically mistaken if we were. We’d have no bodies although we thought we did, the world would contain no physical objects, yet it would seem to us that it did, there’d be no Earth, no Sun, no vast universe, only the brain’s deluded representations of such. At least this could be the case if our representations derived even part of their content from links with mind-independent objects and states of affairs. Since realism implies that such an absurd possibility could hold without our being able to detect it, it has to be rejected, according to anti-realists.

A much stronger anti-realist argument due to Putnam uses the brain-in-a-vat hypothesis to show that realism is internally incoherent rather than, as before, simply false. A crucial assumption of the argument is semantic externalism, the thesis that the reference of our words and mental symbols is partially determined by contingent relations between thinkers and the world. This is a semantic assumption many realists independently endorse.

Given semantic externalism, the argument proceeds by claiming that if we were brains in a vat we could not possibly have the thought that we were. For, if we were so envatted, we could not possibly mean by ‘brain’ and ‘vat’ what unenvatted folk mean by these words since our words would be connected only to neural impulses or images in our brains where the unenvatteds’ words are connected to real-life brains and real-life vats. Similarly, the thought we pondered whenever we posed the question “am I a brain in a vat?” could not possibly be the thought unenvatted folk pose when they ask themselves the same-sounding question in English. But realism entails that we could indeed be brains in a vat. As we have just shown that were we to be so, we could not even entertain this as a possibility, realism is incoherent [Putnam 1981].

3.4 Conceptual Schemes and Pluralism

If the notion of mind-independent existence is incoherent, as anti-realists contend, what should we put in its stead? Berkeley famously answered “Mind-dependent existence!” where the Mind in question, for the good Bishop, was, of course, the Mind of God. Modern anti-realists tend not to be theists and tend not to relativize existence to any single mind. Instead of God they posit conceptual schemes as that on which the notion of existence depends. To that extent they follow Kant rather than Berkeley, though unlike Kant they tend to be pluralists—it is conceptual schemes which they endorse rather than a single transcendental scheme which Kant held to be obligatory for all rational creatures.

According to this view, there can no more be an answer to the question “What objects and properties does the world contain?” outside of some scheme for classifying entities than there can be an answer to the question of whether two events \(A\) and \(B\) are simultaneous outside of some inertial frame for dating those events. The objects which exist are the objects some conceptual scheme says exists—‘mesons exist’ really means ‘mesons exist relative to the conceptual scheme of current physics’.

Realists think there is a unitary sense of ‘object’, ‘property’ etc., for which the question “what objects and properties does the world contain?” makes sense. Any answer which succeeded in listing all the objects, properties, events etc. which the world contains would comprise a privileged description of that totality. Anti-realists reject this. For them ‘object’, ‘property’ etc., shift their senses as we move from one conceptual scheme to another. Some anti-realists argue that there cannot be a totality of all the objects the world contains since the notion of ‘object’ is indefinitely extensible and so, trivially, there cannot be a privileged description of any such totality.

How does the anti-realist defend conceptual relativity? One way is by arguing that there can be two complete theories of the world which are descriptively equivalent yet logically incompatible from the realist’s point of view. For example, theories of space-time can be formulated in one of two mathematically equivalent ways: as an ontology of points, with spatiotemporal regions being defined as sets of points; or as an ontology of regions, with points being defined as convergent sets of regions. Such theories are descriptively equivalent since mathematically equivalent and yet are logically incompatible from the realist’s point of view, anti-realists contend [Putnam 1985, 1990].

3.5 Models and Reality

Putnam’s Model-Theoretic Argument is the most technical of the arguments we have so far considered although we shall not reproduce all the technicalities here. The central ideas can be conveyed informally, although some technical concepts will be mentioned where necessary. The argument purports to show that the Representation Problem—to explain how our mental symbols and words get hooked up to mind-independent objects and how our sentences and thoughts target mind-independent states of affairs—is insoluble.

According to the Model-Theoretic Argument, there are simply too many ways in which our mental symbols can be mapped onto items in the world. The consequence of this is a dilemma for the realist. The first horn of the dilemma is that s/he must accept that what our symbols refer to is massively indeterminate. The second horn is that s/he must insist that even an ideal theory, whose terms and predicates can demonstrably be mapped veridically onto objects and properties in the world might still be false, i.e., that such a mapping might not be the right one, the one ‘intended’.

Neither alternative can be defended, according to anti-realists. Concerning the first alternative, massive indeterminacy for perfectly determinate terms is absurd. As for the second, for realists to contend that even an ideal theory could be false is to resort to unmotivated dogmatism, since on their own admission we cannot tell which mapping the world has set up for us. Such dogmatism leaves the realist with no answer to a skepticism which undermines any capacity to reliably represent the world, anti-realists maintain.

It might be useful to informally illustrate some basic ideas underlying the Model-Theoretic Argument. The discussion to follow trades formal precision for intuitive accessibility. In logic, a theory is a set of sentences. We are going to consider what happens to the interpretation of 3 simple sentences that comprise our theory when we vary the way we refer to the individuals those sentences talk about and also vary how we classify those individuals. So, imagine that you and your four year old niece Maddy are fortunate enough to be watching three elite sprinters at a training session—Usain Bolt, Justin Gatlin and Assafa Powell. Suppose we let the letter b stand for Bolt, g stand for Gatlin and p stand for Powell. These letters are called individual constants. We will also need a single predicate letter J representing the English predicate ‘is Jamaican’ to formulate our 3 sentence theory. In logic we distinguish between theories (sets of sentences) and the things those theories talk about (usually not sentences). The collection of items the theory talks about feature in abstract entities known as structures as the domain of the structure and what the theory says about those items receives an interpretation in the structure. An interpretation function assigns objects from the domain of a structure to individual constants such as our b, g and p and sets of objects (subsets of the domain) to monadic predicates such as our J. If we wish to express relations between objects such as one individual being faster than or taller than another (binary relations) or one individual standing between two others (ternary relations) we will need sets of ordered pairs (for the binary case) or ordered triples (for the ternary case) from the domain. Generally, n-place relations will require our interpretation function to supply n-tuples of objects from the domain as extensions for n-place predicates. By ‘extension’ of a predicate we simply mean the (sets of) things the predicate applies to.

We are going to focus on the simplest case. Our theory asserts that: (1) Bolt is Jamaican, (2) Powell is Jamaican, (3) Gatlin is not Jamaican. We shall write these sentences as (1) \(Jb\), (2) \(Jp\), (3) \(\neg Jg\) respectively. This simple theory is true. When you inform Maddy of these facts you mean to refer to the man Usain Bolt when you use the name ‘Bolt’, to Assafa Powell by the name ‘Powell’ and to Justin Gatlin by ‘Gatlin’. You also mean to be describing the first two sprinters as Jamaican and the last as non-Jamaican when you use the predicate ‘is Jamaican’ in sentences (1), (2) and (3).

A structure in which \(b\) denotes Bolt, \(p\) denotes Powell and \(g\) denotes Gatlin and in which the extension of \(J\) is {Bolt, Powell} will make the sentences (1), (2) and (3) all true. Such a structure is said to be a model of the theory. Furthermore, as the model represents the names ‘Bolt’, ‘Powell’, ‘Gatlin’ as applying to exactly the right individuals and the predicate ‘is Jamaican’ as applying to just the right set of individuals we say the model is an intended model.

However, it is perfectly possible for a structure for a theory to make all its sentences true (and thus be a model of the theory) without that structure being an intended model. Suppose Maddy mistakes which particular individuals you are referring to when you use the names ‘Bolt’, ‘Powell’ and ‘Gatlin’. Perhaps these sprinters lined up in that order for one trial and now line up in a different order for the next trial. Suppose she is also misinformed about what ‘is Jamaican’ describes. Maybe she thinks it applies to a sprinter in the outside or middle lane and although that was the order for Bolt and Powell in the first trial, in the second one which is just about to start Gatlin and Bolt are in the outside and middle lanes.

Let us use \(M\) to denote the intended model of the 3 sentence theory and use \(M^*\) to denote Maddy’s non-standard model. Suppose we use the following notation to mean the individual constant \(b\) refers to Bolt in the model \(M\): \(|b|_M =\) Bolt and so we also represent the facts that in \(M\) the constant g refers to Gatlin and \(p\) refers to Powell respectively as \(|g|_M =\) Gatlin and \(|p|_M =\) Powell. Suppose finally that we symbolize the interpretation of the predicate \(J\) in \(M\) by \(|J|_M =\) {Bolt, Powell}.

We can now compute the truth-values of sentences such as \(Jb\), \(Jg\) and \(Jp\) in the model \(M\). Simple sentences such as these will turn out true in the model if the individual denoted by the individual constant in the model is included in the set of individuals comprising the extension of the predicate \(J\) in the model. Since the individuals assigned to b and p are indeed included in the set that comprises the extension of \(J\) in \(M\), viz. { Bolt, Powell }, we have \(Jb\) and \(Jp\) coming out true in \(M\). However since Gatlin is not included in the set { Bolt, Powell } \(Jg\) comes out false in \(M\), whence \(\neg Jg\) comes out true in \(M\). This is exactly as it should be: Usain Bolt and Assafa Powell are both Jamaican sprinters but Justin Gatlin is an American rather than Jamaican sprinter. We represent these truths as: (i) \(|Jb|_M =\) True, (ii) \(|Jg|_M =\) False, (iii) \(|Jp|_M =\) True.

Maddy’s model \(M*\) is a non-standard or unintended one. She thinks the name ‘Bolt’ refers to Gatlin, the name ‘Powell’ refers to Bolt and the name ‘Gatlin’refers to Powell. Furthermore she thinks the predicate ‘is Jamaican’ applies to Gatlin and Bolt but not to Powell. That is, we have that in \(M*\): \(|b|_{M*} =\) Gatlin, \(|g|_{M*} =\) Powell, \(|p|_{M*} =\) Bolt and for \(J\) our sole predicate \(|J|_{M*} =\) { Gatlin, Bolt }.

In spite of her misunderstanding the intended referents for the sprinters’ names and the intended extension of the predicate ‘is Jamaican’, Maddy’s model \(M*\) assigns exactly the right truth-values for the 3 sentences above as readers can check for themselves. That is: (i) \(|Jb|_{M*} =\) True, (ii) \(|Jg|_{M*} =\) False, (iii) \(|Jp|_{M*} =\) True. The model \(M*\) is said to be a permuted model of \(M\). It is as if the objects in the domain were systematically shuffled around whilst the labels were kept fixed, as Tim Button puts it [Button (2013). The example in the text here was inspired by Button’s Fig 2.1 p.15].

Now consider a very different structure \(N\) the domain of which consists only of the natural numbers 3, 4 and 5. We are going to interpret our simple sprinter theory in \(N\). So suppose \(|b|_N = 3\), \(|g|_N = 4\), \(|p|_N = 5\). Suppose also that our predicate \(J\) is interpreted in \(N\) so as to have the same extension in \(N\) as the English predicate ‘is an odd number’, i.e. \(|J|_N =\) {3,5}. Then, clearly \(N\) is a model of our three sentence theory since we have (i) \(|Jb|_N =\) True, (ii) \(|Jg|_N =\) False, (iii) \(|Jp|_N =\) True. Let us call structures whose domains consist of numbers ‘numeric’ structures.

The nub of Putnam’s Model-Theoretic Argument against realism is that the realist cannot distinguish the intended model for his/her total theory of the world from non-standard interlopers such as permuted models or ones derived from numeric models, even when total theory is a rationally optimal one that consists, as it must do, of an infinite set of sentences and the realist is permitted to impose the most exacting constraints to distinguish between models. This is a very surprising result if true! How does Putnam arrive at it?

Putnam actually uses a number of different arguments to establish the conclusion above. The one of most concern to realists, as Taylor (2006) emphasises, is the one based on Gödel‘s Completeness Theorem. For this argument purports to prove that an ideal theory of the world could not be false, a conclusion flatly inconsistent with realism. It will be useful to first state the logical theorems on which the argument is based.

Let us start with the Completeness Theorem. In 1930 Kurt Gödel proved that a certain type of predicate logic, first-order logic without identity (which we shall sometimes denote as FOL), is complete in the sense that all sentences of that logic that are true under every interpretation can be derived within that logic. This means that every set of FOL sentences S that is ‘syntactically’ consistent (i.e. consistent in the sense that no contradiction can be derived from S within this logic), also has a model [See the entry on Kurt Gödel for further details and a proof of the theorem].

The other theorem we shall need for the Model-Theoretic Argument below goes by the name of the Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem. To understand this theorem, one needs to first know something of the work of the nineteenth century mathematician Georg Cantor in set theory—specifically, his discovery of the different sizes of infinity. Cantor showed that infinite sets could be subdivided into those whose elements could be counted in the sense that their elements could be put into one to one correspondence with the natural numbers and those whose elements could not in this sense be counted. The set of integers is countable, as, surprising as it may seem, is the set of rational numbers. The set of real numbers, however, along with the set of complex numbers and the set of all subsets of the natural numbers are all uncountably infinite. Cantor called the size of an infinite set its cardinality [See the entry on the early development of set theory].

The Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem states that if a a set of FOL sentences has an infinite model, it has a model whose domain is countably infinite. The Upward Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem states that if a countable set of FOL sentences has an infinite model of some cardinality \(\kappa\) then it has a model of every infinite cardinality [See the entry Skolem’s paradox for the history of the theorems and the philosophical issues concerning them].

Now realists believe that even a rationally optimal or ‘ideal’ theory of the world could be mistaken. Putnam essays to prove that this belief is incoherent. But why can’t an ideal theory be false? To admit that this is possible is to admit that there is a gap between what is true and what is ideally warranted by our best theory, something no anti-realist can afford. But an argument is needed to show this is not possible. Anti-realists have one in the Model-Theoretic Argument. It proceeds thus:

Suppose we had an ideal theory which passed every observational and theoretical test we could conceive of. Assume this theory could be formalized in first-order logic. Assume also that the world is infinite in size and that our formalized ideal theory \(T\) says it is. Assume, finally, \(T\) is consistent. Then given these assumptions, Putnam argues, we can show that \(T\) is also true:

Firstly, as \(T\) is syntactically consistent, by the Completeness Theorem for first-order logic, \(T\) will have a model. Then by the Upward Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem, there exists a model elementarily equivalent to the model generated by the Completeness Theorem that is of the same size as the world (since by the Upward Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem \(T\) will have models of every infinite size). Call this model \(M\).

Nothing in the construction of \(M\) guarantees that the objects in its domain are objects in the real world. To the contrary, the domain of \(M\) may be comprised wholly of real numbers for example. So to obtain, as required, a model whose domain consists of objects in the world, use Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem once more to project the model \(M\) onto the world by generating from \(M\) a new model \(W\) whose domain consists of the objects in the world and which assigns to all the predicates of \(T\) subclasses of its domain and relations defined on that domain.

We now have a correspondence between the expressions of the language \(L\) in which \(T\) is expressed and (sets of) objects in the world just as the realist requires. \(T\) will then be true if ‘true’ just means ‘true-in-\(W\)’.

If \(T\) is not guaranteed true by this procedure it can only be because \(W\) is not the intended model. Yet all our observation sentences come out true according to \(W\) and the theoretical constraints must be satisfied because T’s theses all come out true in \(W\) also. So the realist owes us an explanation of what constraints a model has to satisfy for it to be ‘intended’ over and above its satisfying every observational and theoretical constraint we can conceive of.

Suppose on the other hand that the realist is able to somehow specify the intended model. Call this intended model \(W''\). Then nothing the realist can do can possibly distinguish \(W''\) from a permuted variant \(W^*\) which can be specified following Putnam 1994b, 356–357:

We define properties of being a cat* and being a mat* such that:

1. In the actual world cherries are cats* and trees are mats*.
2. In every possible world the two sentences “A cat is on a mat” and “A cat* is on a mat*” have precisely the same truth value.

Instead of considering two sentences “A cat is on a mat” and “A cat* is on a mat*” now consider only the one “A cat is on a mat”, allowing its interpretation to change by first adopting the standard interpretation for it and then adopting the non-standard interpretation in which the set of cats* are assigned to ’cat’ in every possible world and the set of mats* are assigned to ’mat’ in every possible world. The result will be the truth-value of “A cat is on a mat” will not change and will be exactly the same as before in every possible world. Similar non-standard reference assignments could be constructed for all the predicates of a language. [See Putnam 1985, 1994b.]

4. Realist Responses

4.1 Language Use and Understanding

We now turn to some realist responses to these challenges. The Manifestation and Language Acquisition arguments allege there is nothing in an agent’s cognitive or linguistic behaviour that could provide evidence that they had grasped what it is for a sentence to be true in the realist’s sense of ‘true’. How can you manifest a grasp of a notion which can apply or fail to apply without you being able to tell which? How could you ever learn to use such a concept?

One possible realist response is that the concept of truth is actually very simple, and it is spurious to demand that one always be able to determine whether a concept applies. As to the first part, it is often argued that all there is to the notion of truth is what is given by the formula “‘\(p\)’ is true if and only if \(p\)”. The function of the truth-predicate is to disquote sentences in the sense of undoing the effects of quotation—thus all that one is saying in calling the sentence “Yeti are vicious” true is that Yeti are vicious.

It is not clear that this response really addresses the anti-realist’s worry, however. It may well be that there is a simple algorithm for learning the meaning of ‘true’ and that, consequently, there is no special difficulty in learning to apply the concept. But that by itself does not tell us whether the predicate ‘true’ applies to cases where we cannot ascertain that it does. All the algorithm tells us, in effect, is that if it is legitimate to assert \(p\) it is legitimate to assert that ‘\(p\)’ is true. So are we entitled to assert ‘either Socrates did or did not sneeze in his sleep the night before he took the hemlock’ or are we not? Presumably that will depend on what we mean by the sentence, whether we mean to be adverting to two states of affairs neither of which we have any prospect of ever confirming.

Anti-realists follow verificationists in rejecting the intelligibility of such states of affairs and tend to base their rules for assertion on intuitionistic logic, which rejects the universal applicability of the Law of Bivalence (the principle that every statement is either true or false). This law is a foundational semantic principle for classical logic.

A more direct realist response to the Manifestation challenge points to the prevalence in our linguistic practices of realist-inspired beliefs to which we give expression in what we say and do. We assert things like “either there were an odd or an even number of dinosaurs on this planet independently of what anyone believes” and all our actions and other assertions confirm that we really do believe this. Furthermore, the overwhelming acceptance of classical logic by mathematicians and scientists and their rejection of intuitionistic logic for the purposes of mainstream science provides very good evidence for the coherence and usefulness of a realist understanding of truth.

Anti-realists reject this reply. They argue that all we make manifest by asserting things like “either there were an odd or an even number of dinosaurs on this planet independently of what anyone believes” is our pervasive misunderstanding of the notion of truth. They apply the same diagnosis to the realist’s belief in the mind-independence of entities in the world and to counterfactuals which express this belief. We overgeneralize the notion of truth, believing that it applies in cases where it does not, they contend.

An apparent consequence of their view is that reality is indeterminate in surprising ways—we have no grounds for asserting that Socrates did sneeze in his sleep the night before he took the hemlock and no grounds for asserting that he did not and no prospect of ever finding out which. Does this mean that for anti-realists the world contains no such fact as the fact that Socrates did one or the other of these two things? Not necessarily. For anti-realists who subscribe to intuitionistic principles of reasoning, the most that can be said is that there is no present warrant to assert that Socrates either did or did not sneeze in his sleep the night before he took the hemlock.

Perhaps anti-realists are right about all this. But if so, they need to explain how a practice based on a pervasive illusion can be as successful as modern science. Anti-realists perturbed by the manifestability of realist truth are revisionists about parts of our linguistic practice, and the consequence of this revisionist stance is that mathematics and science require extensive and non-trivial revision.

Much could be and has been said by anti-realists in response to this point. Standing back from the debate between the two sides is not always easy but at least this point should be made. Nothing said so far solves the Representation Problem, the problem of how our mental symbols get to target mind-independent entities in the first place, let alone the right ones. Some natural mechanism for generating the right links must be at work for it cannot just be a primitive inexplicable fact that ‘the Big Bang’ refers to the Big Bang. If this problem could be solved, the Manifestation and Acquisition challenges would, presumably, be answered. It would then be the burden of the other pragmatist-inspired anti-realist challenges to show that the realist cannot solve the Representation Problem.

4.2 Language Acquisition

The challenge to realism posed by language acquisition is to explain how a child could come to know the meanings of certain sentences within his/her language: the ones which the realist contends have undetectable truth-makers associated with them. How could the child learn the meanings of such sentences if these meanings are determined by states of affairs not even competent speakers can detect?

How should realists respond to this challenge? They should question the publicity of meaning principle as it applies to language learning and they should question this principle on empirical as well as conceptual grounds. That the meaning of a word is in some sense determined by its use in a given language is little more than a platitude. That the meaning of a word is exhaustively manifest in its use as an instrument of communication is not.

The evidence from developmental psychology indicates some meaning is pre-linguistic and that some pre-linguistic meaning or conceptual content does indeed relate to situations that are not detectable by the child. For example, psychologists have discovered systems of core knowledge activated in infancy that govern the representation of, inter alia concrete objects and human agents [see Spelke 2003; Spelke and Kinzler 2007]. An interesting finding from preferential gaze experiments suggests 4 month old infants represent occluded objects as continuing behind their barriers.

Even more surprisingly, 2 day old chicks exposed to occluded objects for the first time do so as well [Spelke 2003]! Chicks who in their first day of life had imprinted on a centre-occluded object were placed in an unfamiliar cage on their second day and presented with a choice between two versions of the object placed at opposite ends of the cage. In one version, the visible ends were connected; in the other these ends were separated by a visible gap matching the occluder they’d seen the day before. “Chicks selectively approached the connected object, providing evidence that they, like human infants, had perceived the imprinted object to continue behind its occluder” [Spelke 2003, p.283].

So there is evidence that ‘verification-transcendent’ conceptual content might be laid down in the earliest stages of cognitive development.

Recent studies of conflict detection in reasoning suggest the anti-realist’s restriction of the basis for ascriptions of meaning to an overtly behavioural one is unwarranted. It is well-attested that subjects unfamiliar with logic evince belief-bias when they reason, accepting conclusions as following from premises only when those conclusions accord with their background beliefs. On the basis of their inferential dispositions and their think-out-loud protocols, most psychologists had concluded that these subjects are simply unaware of the simple logical rules they appear to flout in the problematic ‘conflict’ cases.

This is not necessarily so, however. In recent years psychologists using more subtle measures to detect recognition of logical rules have found that even the poorest reasoners evince wide range of tacit behavioural and neurological symptoms when they deny the conclusions of valid conflict arguments: (i) lower confidence levels (ii) higher arousal (iii) more frequent saccades to the conflict conclusion and premises (iv) impaired memory access to cued beliefs that conflict with normative logical rules (v) heightened activity in an area of the brain, the anterior cingulate cortex, known to be associated with conflict detection [See for instance De Neys & Glumicic 2008, Franssens & De Neys 2009].

4.3 Radical Skepticism

The Brains-in-a-Vat argument purports to show that, given semantic externalism, realism is incoherent on the grounds that it is both committed to the genuine possibility of our being brains in a vat and yet entails something inconsistent with this: namely, that were we to be so envatted we could not possibly have the thought that we were!

Realists have three obvious responses.

1. Deny realism entails that we could be brains in a vat.
2. Deny semantic externalism.
3. Deny there is any inconsistency between our being brains in a vat and our inability to think that we were brains in a vat were we to be so.

As for (i), naturalistic realists do question the coherence of the idea of our being brains in a vat. For them there is no external vantage point from which one can assess our best overall theory and yet the skeptic’s hypothesis feigns to occupy just such a vantage point. How so? By using terms which derive their meaning from successful theory to pose a problem which, if intelligible, would rob those very terms of meaning. In a similar vein some naturalistic realists have claimed that the mad scientists face an insoluble problem of combinatorial explosion the moment they give you any significant exploratory and volitional powers in the virtual world in which you are imprisoned.

As to the latter, it may be that the clever alien scientists have generated a convincing illusion of significant exploratory and volitional powers in the mind of the poor envatted brain. Whether the skeptic’s prospect is intelligible only at the cost of robbing the very terms in which it is framed of meaning is much more difficult to assess, however.

What of option (ii)—denying semantic externalism? Is this really a live prospect for realists? The answer is “Yes”. Semantic externalism no longer commands the consensus amongst realists that it did when Putnam formulated his Brains-in-a-Vat argument—realists are today divided over the question of externalism. David Lewis, a prominent realist, rejected externalism in favour of a sophisticated semantic internalism based on a ‘Two-Dimensional’ analysis of modality. Frank Jackson [Jackson, F. 2000] contributed to the development of this internalist 2D semantics and used it to formulate a version of materialism grounded on conceptual analysis that provides a useful and persuasive model of a naturalistic realist’s metaphysics.

Other realists reject externalism because they think that the Representation Problem is just a pseudo-problem. When we say things like “‘cat’ refers to cats” or “‘quark’ refers to quarks” we are simply registering our dispositions to call everything we consider sufficiently cat-like/quark-like, ‘cat’/’quark’.

According to these semantic deflationists, it is just a confusion to ask how the link was set up between our use of the term ‘the Big Bang’ and the event of that name which occurred some fourteen billion years ago. Some naturalistic story can, presumably, be told about how creatures like us developed the linguistic dispositions we did, in the telling of which it will emerge how we come to assert things like “the entropy of the Big Bang was very low”.

But it is a moot question whether semantic deflationism really dissolves the Representation Problem or merely fails to face up to it. However the story about the origins of our linguistic dispositions is told, it had better be that our utterances of “the entropy of the Big Bang was very low” somehow end up evincing just the right sort of differential sensitivity to the Big Bang’s having low entropy. For if all there is to the story are our linguistic dispositions and the conditions to which they are presently attuned, the case has effectively been ceded to the anti-realist who denies it is possible to set up a correlation between our utterances or thoughts and the mind-independent states of affairs which, according to the metaphysical realist, uniquely make them true.

The most effective realist rejoinder is (iii). We shall return to this response after we have reviewed Putnam’s Brains-in-a-Vat Argument, BIVA.

How does Putnam prove we can know we are not brains in a vat? To understand Putnam’s argument, we need to first recall the ‘Twin-Earth’ considerations used to support Semantic Externalism: on Twin-Earth things are exactly as they are here on Earth except for one difference—whereas for Earthly humans water has the chemical composition H₂O, for our döppelgangers on Twin-Earth, twumans, water is instead composed of some substance unknown to us on Earth, XYZ. Now when you and your twuman counterpart say (or think) “’Water’ refers to water” both of you utter (or think) truths. But which truth you both think or utter differs. For humans “’Water’ refers to water” expresses the truth that the term ‘water’ in English refers to that substance whose chemical composition is H₂O. For our twuman Twin-Earth counterparts, however, their sentence “’Water’ refers to water” expresses the truth that their term ‘water’ in Twenglish refers to that substance whose chemical composition is XYZ.

With these points about Externalism in mind, consider Putnam’s BIVA [we follow Anthony Brueckner’s formulation here: see the entry skepticism and content externalism]. Let us call whatever it is that an envatted brain’s symbol ‘tree’ refers to, if it refers at all, \(v\)-trees. Then the BIVA is:

• (1) If I’m a BIV then it is not the case that if my word ‘tree’ refers it refers to trees.
• (2) If my word ‘tree’ refers it refers to trees.
• (3) So, I am not a BIV.

Now (1) is correct: if I am a brain-in-a-vat then my symbol ‘tree’ cannot refer to trees since there aren’t any trees in the vat-world—a BIV’s ‘tree’ symbol refers to \(v\)-trees, not trees. But what reason do we have to believe (2)?

Just as we can do, our twuman döppelgangers on Twin-Earth can justifiably declare “If my word ‘water’ refers it refers to water.” But despite the fact that the twumans’ language Twenglish is a homophonic duplicate of English, ‘water’ on Twin-Earth refers to twater, XYZ, not water, H₂O.

Instead of (2) we really need two premises incorporating distinct hypotheses about the language I am speaking:

• (2E) If the language I am speaking is English and my word ‘tree’ refers, it refers to trees.
• (2V) If the language I am speaking is Venglish (Vattish English) and my word ‘tree’ refers, it refers to trees.

To preserve the logical form of the original argument, (1) must also be modified to accept each hypothesis about the language I am speaking so that it now bifurcates into:

• (1E) (1E) If I’m a BIV then it is not the case that if the language I am speaking is English and my word ‘tree’ refers it refers to trees.
• (1V) If I’m a BIV then it is not the case that if the language I am speaking is Venglish and my word ‘tree’ refers it refers to trees.

The problem with Putnam’s BIVA is that while (1V) is true, (2V) is false whereas although (2E) is true, (1E) is false. On either hypothesis about the language I am speaking, it appears that there is no sound argument to the conclusion that I am not a brain-in-a-vat.

Suppose the BIVA is unsound. What would this show? Even if the BIVA fails to achieve its goal, Putnam’s challenge to the realist remains unanswered. This was to show how realism could be coherent if it is committed both to:

• (I) The real possibility that we are brains-in-a-vat

and to the consequence that:

• (II) Were we to be BIVs we could not have the thought that we were.

In fact, there is no logical incoherence in accepting both (I) and (II)—as the figure below illustrates. There is thus no logical incoherence in believing both that it is possible that one is a BIV and that if one is a BIV one could never come to know this.

Nick Bostrom has recently argued it is quite likely that we humans are actually virtual humans: computer simulations of flesh and blood creatures. Bostrom reasons that if our mental lives can be simulated it is in fact extremely likely that our distant descendants (more intelligent or at least more technologically advanced ‘post-human’ successors) will eventually create such a simulation in which case it is more likely that we are the unwitting denizens of a simulated world than the flesh and blood inhabitants of the real world we take ourselves to be. At least this will be so unless the chances that creatures of our intelligence are doomed to become extinct before reaching the technological sophistication to create simulations are overwhelmingly large or else almost no such technologically capable civilizations have any interest in simulating minds like ours in the first place [Bostrom, N., 2003].

Bostrom’s argument makes it look unlikely that we can know a priori that we are not brains-in-a-vat, when BIVs are understood to be virtual humans in a simulation. If this is correct, Putnam’s attempt to prove we are not BIVs must be flawed. Whether the Simulation Argument poses further problems for realism is a moot point.

4.4 Conceptual Schemes and Pluralism

In this section I shall outline the anti-realist’s idea of conceptual relativity and indicate some ways realists might wish to contest that notion. I shall not try to distinguish between conceptual relativism and conceptual pluralism. Conceptual relativism looks highly counter-intuitive to realists since it seems to make the existence of all things relative to the classificatory skills of minds. Whilst it may be quite plausible to think that moral values or perhaps even colours might disappear with the extinction of sentient life on Earth, it is not at all plausible to think that trees, rocks and microbes would follow in their train. If that is what it commits us to, then the idea of conceptual relativity looks highly suspect.

This is not how anti-realists understand conceptual relativity, however. As they see things, we accept a theory which licenses us to assert “ Electrons exist ” and also licenses us to assert “if humans were to disappear from this planet, electrons need not follow in their train” since the theory assures us that the existence of electrons in no way causally depends on the existence of humans. For the anti-realist our well-founded practices of assertion ground at one and the same time our conception of the world and our conception of humanity’s place within it.

Realists might still worry that whether there are to be any electrons in the anti-realist’s ontology apparently depends upon the conceptual schemes humans happen to chance upon. The relativity of existence to conceptual scheme is, in this respect, quite unlike the relativity of simultaneity to frame of reference.

Still, we have actual instances of conceptual schemes which explain the same phenomena equally well yet which realists must adjudge logically incompatible anti-realists maintain. The earlier example of competing theories of space-time was a case in point. On one theory, space-time consists of unextended spatiotemporal points and regions of space-time are sets of these points. According to the second theory, space-time consists of extended spatiotemporal regions and points are logical constructions—convergent sets of regions.

Anti-realists regard two theories as descriptively equivalent if each theory can be interpreted in the other and both theories explain the same phenomena. Is there nothing more to the notion of descriptive equivalence than this? Realists might not accept that there isn’t.

At the stroke of midnight Cinderella’s carriage changes into a pumpkin—it is a carriage up to midnight, a pumpkin thereafter. According to the region-based theory which takes temporal intervals as its primitives, that’s all there is to it. But if there are temporal points, instants, there is a further fact left undecided by this story—viz, at the moment of midnight is the carriage still a carriage or is it a pumpkin?

So does the region-based theory fail to recognize certain facts or are these putative facts merely artefacts of the punctate theory’s descriptive resources, reflecting nothing in reality? We cannot declare the two theories descriptively equivalent until we resolve this question at least.

In general, then, realists either dismiss cases of apparent logical incompatibility between two descriptively equivalent rival theories as merely apparent or question the descriptive equivalence of the two theories.

The conceptual relativity we have been discussing has its roots in Carnap’s views about linguistic frameworks. As we saw in section 2, Carnap rejected the idea that we could answer existence questions in any absolute sense. If we ask, as we did before, whether there are irrational numbers \(a, b\) such that \(a^b\) is rational, Carnap requires we first specify a framework before tendering any reply. If we choose classical mathematics the answer is “Yes” but if we choose intuitionistic mathematics, the answer is “There is no warrant for asserting such \(a\) and \(b\) exist.” So according to Carnap whilst the claim that irrational numbers \(a, b\) such that \(a^b\) is rational exist-in-CM is perfectly true, the claim that such \(a, b\) exist simpliciter is meaningless.

We saw in section 2, though, that the questions dividing realists from anti-realists appear to survive indexation to frameworks. Revisionary intuitionists who object to non-constructive existence proofs in mathematics are not just expressing a preference for constructive methods: they find the notion of non-constructive existence unintelligible not just unappealing:

So consider this case: Ernie looks into his bag and sees there are 3 coins and nothing else, so he announces “There are exactly 3 objects in my bag.” Max looks into Ernie’s bag and shakes his head “No Ernie there are 7 objects in your bag!” he corrects him. The Carnapian pluralist feels she can defuse the conflict and accommodate both points of view by maintaining that whilst 3 objects exist-in-\(E\) (where \(E\) is Ernie’s everyday framework), 7 objects exist-in-\(M\) (with \(M\) Max’s mereological framework). But even if Max can endorse both of these claims (since the mereological objects include Ernie’s 3 marbles), it is not at all certain Ernie can do so. If Ernie is unpersuaded that mereological fusions of objects are themselves objects, then Max’s putative truthmaker for his framework-relative existence claim “7 objects exist-in-\(M\)” will be unconvincing to him.

For this case, there seems little reason to accept the pluralist’s description that whilst 3 objects exist-in-\(E\), 7 objects exist-in-\(M\) and some good reasons not to. By ‘object’ Ernie means ordinary object, by ‘object’ Max means mereological object. Nothing deeper than that is required to explain their disagreement. What is relativized in the first instance is not existence or truth but meaning. To the non-relativist, it looks as if pluralists have simply mistaken a plurality of meanings for a plurality of modes of being.

This is not to say that all there ever is to such disputes is a misunderstanding about the meanings of words. There is still the substantive question of which of two theories conceived as rivals is true. Thus in the dispute between classical and intuitionist logicians the attempt to import distinctive intuitionistic connectives into classical languages containing classical connectives results in the ‘intuitionistic’ connectives obeying classical logical laws.

The point is rather that whether there are mereological (or ordinary) objects ought not to be prejudged by stipulating they exist within some framework nor can it be resolved satisfactorily by this means. By way of comparison, consider the question of whether space-time is continuous or discrete. This looks like a substantive empirical question. If String Theory which says space-time is continuous and Quantum Loop Gravity Theory which says it is discrete were to prove equally good ‘final’ theories of space-time as judged by all the evidence, we would naturally take this to demonstrate that the matter of whether space-time was a continuum had turned out to be empirically undecidable, not that space-time had turned out in one sense to be continuous (continuous_ST) but in another to be discrete (discrete_QLGT)—if we can know this type of thing at all, this is something we can know a priori without heeding any evidence. Rightly or wrongly, we would take the question “Is Space-Time continuous or discrete?” to remain unsolved in the envisaged circumstances, rather than equally well though divergently solved. We might then go on to cite this case as a good example of underdetermination of theory by evidence.

Moreover, the space-time and mereological examples bring to light another problem for pluralism. If there is no framework-neutral metalanguage neo-Carnapians can deploy to state their purported framework-relative ontological truths, how can there be a fact to the matter as to what things exist in a framework? Realists might then wonder whether the pluralist’s position doesn’t threaten to become ineffable.

4.5 Models and Reality

If metaphysical realism is to be tenable, it must be possible for even the best theories to be mistaken. Or so metaphysical realists have thought. Whence, such realists reject the Model-Theoretic Argument MTA which purports to show that this is not possible. Here is an informal sketch of the MTA due to van Fraassen [1997]:

Let \(T\) be a theory that contains all the sentences we insist are true, and that has all other qualities we desire in an ideal theory. Suppose moreover that there are infinitely many things, and that \(T\) says so. Then there exist functions (interpretations) which assign to each term in \(T\)’s vocabulary an extension, and which satisfy \(T\). So we conclude, to quote Putnam, “\(T\) comes out true, true of the world, provided we just interpret ‘true’ as TRUE(SAT)”.

Here ‘TRUE(SAT)’ means “true relative to a mapping of the terms of the language of \(T\) onto (sets of) items in the world”.

But why should we interpret ‘true’ as TRUE(SAT)? Because truth is truth in an intended model and, Putnam argues, amongst all the models of \(T\) that make all its theses come out true there is guaranteed to be at least one that passes all conceivable constraints we can reasonably impose on a model in order for it to be an intended model of \(T\).

Realists have responded to the argument by rejecting the claim that a model \(M\) of the hypothetical ideal theory \(T\) passes every theoretical constraint simply because all of the theory’s theses come out true in it. For there is no guarantee, they claim, that terms stand in the right relation of reference to the objects to which \(M\) links them. To be sure, if we impose another theoretical constraint, say:

Right Reference Constraint (RRC): Term \(t\) refers to object \(x\) if and only if \(Rtx\) where \(R\) is the right relation of reference,

then \(M\) (or some model based on it) can interpret this RRC constraint in such a way as to make it come out true.

But there is a difference between a model’s making some description of a constraint come out true and its actually conforming to that constraint, metaphysical realists insist [Devitt 1983, 1991; Lewis 1983, 1984].

For their part, anti-realists have taken the metaphysical realist’s insistence on a Right Reference Constraint to be ‘just more theory’—what it is for a model to conform to a constraint is for us to be justified in asserting that it does. Unfortunately, this has led to something of a stand-off. Metaphysical realists think that anti-realists are refusing to acknowledge a clear and important distinction. Anti-realists think realists are simply falling back on dogmatism at a crucial point in the argument.

On the face of it, the Permutation Argument presents a genuine challenge to any realist who believes in determinate reference. But it does not refute metaphysical realism unless such realism is committed to determinate reference in the first place and it is not at all obvious that this is so.

Realist responses to this argument vary widely. At one extreme are the ‘determinatists’, those who believe that Nature has set up significant, determinate referential connections between our mental symbols and items in the world. They contend that all the argument shows is that the distribution of truth-values across possible worlds is not sufficient to determine reference.

At another extreme are ‘indeterminatists’, realists who concede the conclusion, agreeing that it demonstrates that word-world reference is massively indeterminate or ‘inscrutable’.

Some infer from this that reference could not possibly consist in correspondences between mental symbols and objects in the world. For them all that makes ‘elephant’ refer to elephants is that our language contains the word ‘elephant’. This is Deflationism about reference.

In between these two extremes are those prepared to concede the argument establishes the real possibility of a significant and surprising indeterminacy in the reference of our mental symbols but who take it to be an open question whether other constraints can be found which pare down the range of reference assignments to just the intuitively acceptable ones. On this view ‘elephant’ may partially refer to elephants according to one acceptable reference assignment and may partially refer to elephant-stages or undetached elephant parts according to other such assignments, but not refer, even partially, to quolls or quarks. In this spirit, Hartry Field [1998] has argued that an objective referential indeterminacy he calls ‘correlative indeterminacy’ could exist quite undetected in linguistic practices such as ours that assume determinacy of reference for terms:

If ‘entropy’ partially refers to \(E_1\) and \(E_2\), then we can say that relative to an assignment of \(E_1\) to ‘entropy’, ‘refers’ refers to a relation that holds between ‘entropy’ and only one thing, viz. \(E_1\); and analogously for \(E_2\). In this way we can get the result that even if ‘entropy’ partially refers to many things (and hence does not determinately refer to anything), still the sentence “‘Entropy’ refers to entropy and nothing else” comes out true. (Indeed, determinately true: true on every acceptable combination of the partial referents of ‘entropy’ and ‘refers’). The advocate of indeterminacy can still ‘speak with the vulgar’. [loc. cit., p. 254]

The simplest and most direct response to the MTA questions its validity—since all versions of the MTA challenge the realist to say why terms are not related to their right referents in the alternative models Putnam constructs, metaphysical realists have been quick to respond. Thus Devitt and Lewis claim that Putnam’s alternative model \(M\) has not been shown to satisfy every theoretical constraint merely by making some description of each theoretical constraint true.

Skolem’s Paradox in set theory seems to present a striking illustration of Lewis’s distinction. The Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem states that every consistent, countable set of first-order formulae has a denumerable model, in fact a model in the set of integers \(\mathbb{Z}\). Now in ZF one can prove the existence of sets with a non-denumerable number of elements such as the set \(\mathbb{R}\) of real numbers. Yet the ZF axioms comprise a consistent, countable set of first-order formulae and thus by the Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem has a model in \(\mathbb{Z}\). So ZF’s theorem \(\phi\) stating that \(\mathbb{R}\) is non-denumerable will come out true in a denumerable model \(\mu\) of ZF!

How can this be? One explanation is that \(\mu\) makes \(\phi\) true only at the cost of re-interpreting the term ‘non-denumerable’ so that it no longer means non-denumerable. Thus \(\mu\) is not the intended model \(M^*\) of ZF. It looks as if the metaphysical realist has a clear illustration of Lewis’s distinction at hand in set theory.

Unfortunately for the realist, this is not the only explanation. In fact, Putnam used this very example in an early formulation of the MTA! Just because there are different models that satisfy \(\phi\) in some of which \(\mathbb{R}\) is non-denumerable but in others of which (such as \(\mu\)) \(\mathbb{R}\) is denumerable, Putnam argued, it is impossible to pin down the intended interpretation of ‘set’ via first-order axioms. Moreover, well before Putnam, Skolem and his followers had taken the moral of Skolem’s Paradox to be that set-theoretic notions are indeterminate [For further discussion, see the entry on Skolem’s paradox].

Now the thesis the metaphysical realist has to establish is that an ideal theory could be false. If truth for our imagined ideal theory \(T\) is truth on its intended model(s) \(M^*\) this amounts to the possibility that some thesis of \(T\) come out false in \(M^*\) even if there are other models wherein that thesis along with every other thesis of \(T\) comes out true. This brings us to the Right Reference Constraint (RRC) once more and the question of what it is for \(T\) to satisfy (RRC). Discussing this issue in connection with set theory Timothy Bays [2001] writes:

When a philosopher claims that the intended models of set theory should be transitive, she is describing the structures which are to count as models for her axioms; she isn’t just adding new sentences to be interpreted at Putnam’s favorite models. Similarly, when she claims that intended models should satisfy second-order ZFC, she is explaining which semantics (and, more specifically, which satisfaction relation) her axioms should be interpreted under; she isn’t just adding new axioms to be interpreted under a (first-order) semantics of Putnam’s choosing.

Putnam [1985] responded to this point by charging the realist with question-begging: simply assuming that terms such as ‘satisfaction’ or ‘correspondence’ refer to those relations to which the realist wishes them to refer. But, as Bays points out, no questions are begged if realists assume for the purposes of argument that semantic terms such as these refer to the intended relations. It is up to the anti-realist to show that this assumption is flawed. Nonetheless, merely invoking an intuitive distinction does not show the distinction marks a genuine difference. So if realism is to be sustained, there had better be some more convincing or, at any rate, less contentious examples than Skolem’s Paradox to illustrate Lewis’s alleged difference between a model M’s satisfying a constraint and M’s merely making a description of the constraint true. Are there?

Michael Resnick thinks so [Resnick 1987]. Putnam maintained that \(M\), the model he constructs of the ideal theory \(T\), is an intended model because it passes every operational and theoretical constraint we could reasonably impose. It passes every theoretical constraint, he argues, simply because it makes every thesis of \(T\) true. But unless the Reflection Principle (RP) below holds, Resnick argues, this inference is just a non-sequitur:

• (RP) To any condition \(f\) that a model of a theory satisfies, there corresponds a condition \(C\) expressible in the theory that that theory satisfies.

However, this principle is false. The simplest counterexample to it, Resnick points out, is Tarskian truth. Suppose we impose on \(T\)’s model \(M\) a condition \(f^*\) that \(M\) makes all of \(T\)’s theses come out true. Then, unless \(T\) is either inconsistent or too weak to express elementary arithmetic no truth predicate will be definable in \(T\). Whence there will be no condition \(C\) expressible in \(T\) corresponding to this condition \(f^*\) on \(T\)’s model(s) \(M\).

Resnick concludes (ibid):

Any true interpretation of \(T\) whatsoever—even one which does not satisfy \(C\)—will make true every thesis of \(T\), including T’s assertion that \(C\) is satisfied. Which suffices to block the ‘just more theory’ gambit.

If this is right, the metaphysical realist can indeed resist what Lewis calls “Putnam’s incredible thesis” that an ideal theory \(T\) has to be true. More recently, there have been some sophisticated anti-realist attempts to buttress the Model-Theoretic Argument against Lewis-styled criticisms [Taylor 2006; Button 2013]. Whether these newer formulations of the MTA succeed in doing so is an open question.

5. Summary

We have considered a number of semantic challenges to realism, the thesis that the objects and properties that the world contains exist independently of our conception or perception of them. These challenges have come from two camps: (1) neo-verificationists led by Dummett who assimilate belief in mind-independent world to a belief in a verification-transcendent conception of truth which they profess to find unintelligible, and (2) pragmatists led by Putnam who also question the intelligibility of the realist’s mind-independent world but for reasons independent of any commitment to verificationism.

On all fronts, debate between realists and their anti-realist opponents is still very much open. If realists could provide a plausible theory about how correspondences between mental symbols and the items in the world to which they refer might be set up, many of these challenges could be met. Alternatively, if they could explain how, consistently with our knowledge of a mind-independent world, no such correspondences are required to begin with, many of the anti-realist objections would fall away as irrelevant. In the absence of such explanations it is still entirely reasonable for realists to believe that the correspondences are in place, however, and there can, indeed, be very good evidence for believing this. Ignorance of Nature’s reference-fixing mechanism is no reason for denying it exists.

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Acknowledgments

Thanks to Jesse Alama and a subject editor for the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy for their helpful criticisms and corrections. Special thanks to Marinus Ferreira for many useful suggestions and for help in writing and editing this entry.