Notes to Reference

1. Searle (1983) claims that to construe reference-determining content as in all cases specifiable linguistically, is to misconstrue the nature of such content. Some such content may (for instance) be perceptually based, but not linguistically specifiable.

2. That such names fail to refer is controversial. See, for instance, van Inwagen (1979), Parsons (1980), Zalta (1983), and Salmon (1998).

3. See, for instance, Salmon (1986) and Soames (1989).

4. For a formal proof of the necessity of identity in quantified modal logic, see Marcus (1947).

5. Kripke's views on names were developed in light of Marcus's. See especially Marcus (1961), along with the ensuing appendix, both of which appear in her (1993). The appendix contains a discussion of Marcus (1961), in which Kripke, then an undergraduate, participated.

6. For an excellent summary of these and a number of other problems for description theories, see Devitt and Sterelny (1999).

7. This problem is also noted by Donnellan (1972).

8. We say ‘adumbrated’ only because Kripke insisted that he was not presenting a ‘theory’ — only a ‘picture.’

9. See Devitt and Sterelny (1999) for how this might be done.

10. See also Dever (1997), section 2.3.2.4.1.1 and Guerts (1999), section 7.3.

11. A significant literature has sprouted up regarding this claim, centered on what has been called ‘the answering machine paradox’. For a survey of this literature, see Cohen and Michaelson (2013).

12. See, in particular, Predelli (1996, 2002).

13. See also Reimer (1991b), Roberts (2002), and Gauker (2008). Note that Reimer subsequently changed her mind, endorsing a speaker-oriented view in Reimer (2002).

14. Recanati (2004) and Bach (2005) have argued that this sort of intentionalist thesis entails giving up on the claim that impure indexicals have characters. Stokke (2010), on the other hand, has argued that this conclusion is under-motivated and has advocated treating the characters of impure indexicals as intention-sensitive.

15. This terminology was introduced to recent philosophy of language in the exchange between Donnellan (1966, 1968) and MacKay (1968).

16. For a recent example of this misunderstanding of Kaplan, see Siegel (2002). Strangely, Siegel goes on to offer a view that is essentially identical what Kaplan actually endorsed while purporting to offer an alternative to Kaplan's position.

17. More recent invocations of Gricean restrictions on reference can be found in Neale (2004) and Stokke (2010).

18. We are assuming here that ‘gnomes’ and ‘unicorns’ don't refer to anything. But this is controversial. See the papers mentioned in note 2.

19. See, for instance, the papers in Bezuidenhout and Reimer (2004) by Kent Bach, Michael Devitt, Geoffrey Nunberg, and Nathan Salmon.

20. Parsons (1980) has argued for a revised version of Meinong's view, claiming that Quine's talk of a ‘bloated universe’ is exaggerated rhetoric.

21. Salmon is hardly the only contemporary philosopher to defend the view that ‘empty’ names refer to abstract objects. See, for instance, van Inwagen (1979), Zalta (1983), Thomasson (1998), and Kripke (2013).

22. For deflationary accounts of reference see, for instance, Brandom (1994), Horwich (1998), and Field (2001)